Steven Wall’s latest book Enforcing Morality covers a lot more ground than its title appears to offer. He defends the enforcement of morality-in-a-broad-sense, which encompasses norms about (1) what ways of living are worthwhile and valuable; (2) what kinds of conduct wrong others without imposing harm on them absent their consent; (3) what impersonal goods, such as landscapes of natural beauty, persons might be required to preserve for their inherent value, to some degree independently of whether that preservation would improve human or animal welfare; (4) what character traits anyone has moral or prudential reason to cultivate in oneself or refrain from developing; (5) what cultural traditions, morally optional in themselves, members of a society might permissibly use state power to sustain; and (6) what conduct toward self or others is inherently immoral, even though it does not wrong anyone. Wall tells his readers at the outset that he is concerned with enforcement in a broad sense as well as with morality in a broad sense. This enforcement includes carrots as well as sticks and withholding benefits as well as imposing harms, both generally and particularly with respect to criminal punishment.
The topics this book treats have stimulated a large, imposing philosophical literature. Some hold that the only sound reason to restrict anyone’s liberty coercively is to prevent their restricting or extinguishing the liberty of others. Others hold that each person has an absolute, sovereign right against interference with her self-regarding actions, except to prevent nonconsensual harm or nuisance offense to others. Still others hold that the state must remain strictly neutral between people’s different morally innocent conceptions of the good, treating anyone neither more nor less favorably on the basis of their adherence to one or another conception. Wall himself has made important contributions to this literature, roughly opposing the positions just mentioned. Enforcing Morality engages in nuanced, complicated dialogue with this complex literature. This makes for continuously rewarding reading, though not for an easy read.
Wall identifies an interesting political project, which he names “ethical environmentalism”. He stipulates that the ethical environment of concern consists of morally significant features of a political society that affect all or almost all its inhabitants. The ethical environmentalist project is a collective effort on the part of all members—acting individually and together—to improve its quality. The effort includes deliberately using the state for this purpose.
Wall advances a presumptive case for the acceptability of this political project: The ethical environment of a society is an important part of the common good of the society, and a morally legitimate function of the state is to advance the common good of the society. So, a morally legitimate function of the state is to advance its ethical environment—that is, to improve its quality. The common good as conceived here can be advanced by measures that do not benefit all or almost all, but rather benefit some and impose costs on others. This is so even with costs that push some below the level of benefits they would get under fully just arrangements, provided that the measures that push some down are, all things considered, bringing about a more just outcome and facilitating the transition to fully just arrangements.
Wall further argues that we have substantial moral reasons to use state power in ways that are paternalistic and in the other ways mentioned three paragraphs above. These moral reasons are strong enough to outweigh all of the significant moral arguments political philosophers have put forward to support principled limits on morally acceptable uses of state power that, if sound, would absolutely rule out the acceptability of ethical environmentalism. If Wall is right, then none of these proposed principled limits on morally acceptable uses of state power—often claimed by their proponents to be essential components of any plausible truly liberal doctrine—are sound.
Wall’s argument so far, even if successful, would establish only the in-principle acceptability of using state power to improve those special moral features of the society that affect all or almost all inhabitants. It does not follow that in actual circumstances we should devote much by way of resources and effort to do this, even if we have a duty to improve the ethical environment under some construal. We could alternatively fulfill that wider duty by working to improve moral features of our local environment at the level of family, friends, workplace, village, or other subregion of our society, or by working to have an impact beyond our national borders. The final chapter of this book contains a sensible discussion of pragmatic reasons to be skeptical of the ethical environmental project. Wall states reasons to be hopeful that properly moralized, cost-benefit analysis will often favor actually engaging in it. Such analysis, beyond showing that attempts at society-wide ethical environmentalism would not be expectably futile, would have to assess the comparative merits of alternative uses of scarce resources to advance other moral projects.
The presumptive case for ethical environmentalism is buttressed, according to Wall, by an important further consideration. He argues for an “integration thesis” to the effect that “the ethical, the moral, and the impersonally valuable interact in ways that make an exclusive focus on one without attending to the others inapt” (111). Hence, in order to determine the content of the narrow part of morality that encompasses just what we morally owe to others by way of enforceable duties, we must consider truths of broad morality. On reflection, broad morality may shape narrow morality, ultimately directly determining part of its content.
In this connection, consider the case for paternalism: restricting people’s freedom against their will for their own good, whether by criminal law prohibitions, “sin” taxes imposed on self-harming activities, or by other measures. To simplify, divide the population into those who make choices prudently and the rest. The prudent choosers will never benefit and only suffer loss from paternalistic restrictions. For example, absent restriction, they will use heroin only when doing so boosts their welfare. The rest of us—prone to choose what is to our detriment—can benefit from such restrictions, and the very imprudent can benefit a lot. On the whole and on average, prudent choosers will be headed toward lives higher in welfare than the imprudent. So, an issue of distributive fairness arises when a state implements paternalistic policies or refrains from doing so. Various egalitarian and prioritarian distributive justice norms say that we have duties to boost people’s welfare and tilt in favor of helping the worse off. These norms will imply that, depending on the numbers, we can have duties to bring about restrictions of people’s liberty for their own good, even against their reflective will. Here, what we morally owe to others is partly set by what activities and ways of living are worthwhile and welfare-enhancing.
Complications loom, and Wall adeptly responds. For one, some especially imprudent choosers will respond to paternalistic restrictions by evading the restrictions, even at great cost to themselves; these extremely imprudent choosers will tend to be among those headed toward lives extremely low in welfare. Wall notes that what is distributively fair depends on the numbers of people affected by state action in various ways, the amounts of costs and benefits they incur from it, and how badly or well off they would otherwise be. These calculations can favor state restrictions.
Another complication is that those who end up badly off via their imprudent choices will usually be responsible in varying degrees for these choices and the consequences for their welfare that ensue. This responsibility factor dampens the duties falling on other people to assist them. To this, Wall makes two replies. First, a dampening need not extinguish. (I would add that one’s imprudence may be due more to one’s unchosen capacities than to anything for which one could reasonably be held responsible.) His more interesting reply is that we should distinguish responsibility for the social framework in which choice occurs from responsibility for the choices one makes in that given context. Both framework and individual choice-making contribute to determining what choices are made and executed with what results. The individual choosing imprudently does not bear responsibility for the framework; rather, at least in a democracy, all of us in the role of citizens bear this responsibility.
It should be noted that Wall’s discussion is pitched at a high level of abstraction. He does not commit to an egalitarian or prioritarian account of distributive fairness or any other account. He is illustrating how ideals of the good life in conjunction with the distributive fairness component of narrow morality can possibly defeat the claim that state power should only be used to prevent people from harming others without their voluntary consent.
The integration thesis in Wall’s hands also supports his claim that the broad morality that we should enforce is objectively correct morality, not whatever morality happens to be socially accepted. His thought here is that few doubt that claims about the content of narrow morality constituting what we morally owe to each other can be objectively correct or incorrect. If narrow morality gets some of its content from claims of ethics (what activities and ways of life are worthwhile) and other broadly moral claims, the former can be objectively right or wrong only if the latter can be.
Along with this moral objectivity claim, Wall embraces pluralism about the good. There are competing, good ways of living, and no way of measuring whether lives pursuing one way with success are prudentially superior to lives successfully pursuing alternative, good ways. He also embraces the idea that rationally holding positive attitudes toward the particular, good way of life one is pursuing enhances its prudential value.
What about the further links between what we morally owe to one another, (1) impersonal values, (2) the desirability of virtuous character, and (3) actions that are deemed wrong in themselves, even if they have no effects on anyone’s welfare? These further links that Wall tries to forge may be of doubtful strength, at least they appear so in this reviewer’s estimation. However, the reader will find that the arguments Wall constructs in the attempt to forge them are without exception intricate, interesting, not easily dismissible, and of a quality that will repay careful study. This review limits itself to brief comments on (1) and (3).
On (1): Wall argues that there are moral reasons and duties to bring about what is impersonally valuable—valuable for its own sake independently of any instrumental value or disvalue it might have for any persons (or other sentient beings). Wall holds that the realm of impersonal value encompasses objects of natural beauty and perfectionist achievements. He notes that what is valuable for persons and boosts their welfare can depend on things being impersonally valuable. Viewing the Grand Canyon with appreciation, awe, and other appropriate attitudes contributes to the welfare of these viewing and appreciating persons only because the Grand Canyon is an impersonally valuable object of natural beauty. So, sharply distinguishing personal and impersonal value fails: impersonal value bleeds into personal value.
However, accepting this last claim does not show that we have moral reasons to boost impersonal value for its own sake as Wall affirms. The impersonal value constituted by the beauty of a natural object, for example, might give us moral reasons to bring it about or preserve it only on the condition that this impersonal value eventually contributes to the welfare of persons or other sentient beings. If some actions we might choose would increase the chances that the Grand Canyon would survive for millions of years but for sure would never be viewed with appreciation by any sentient creatures nor contribute to their welfare in other ways, boosting these chances gives us no reason whatsoever and certainly no moral reasons to choose those actions. So, anyway, I claim. Same goes with perfectionist achievements. Creating good art boosts the welfare of its creators in itself, and understanding, appreciating, and enjoying good art increase the welfare of those gaining these achievements. These facts, however, generate no reasons to preserve good art that for sure will never be seen by anyone nor contribute in other ways to anyone’s welfare. Call this the lonely planet objection to this part of the broad moralism position.
Turn to (3). Setting paternalism and impersonal goods to the side, the enforcement of morality in the broad sense is standardly thought also to encompass legal moralism—using state power to prevent the doing of acts that are morally wrong in themselves, independently of whether they are harmful (or beneficial, we might add) to anyone. Are there such acts, and if so, is it sometimes morally permissible or even morally mandatory to use state power to prevent them? Wall answers “yes” and “yes”. In this connection, he observes that even one’s fully voluntary consent to being treated or treating oneself in some way does not rule out being wronged by the treatment if one lacks a right to consent to such treatment. Furthermore, one lacks a right to consent to treatment that fails to respect the kind of being one is, namely, a person with rational, agential capacities. Wall gives examples, including facilitating and freely participating in fight-to-the-death gladiator contests, as possible instances of conduct that is wrong on this moralistic basis.
I suspect that welfare harms and benefits to self and (actual and possible) others and their fair distribution across persons exhaust the reasons that determine what we morally owe to one another. Candidate examples of wrongful conduct falling under the heading of legal moralism can be accounted for as wrongful on this broadly welfarist basis or else fail to qualify as morally wrongful. But, to put it mildly, Enforcing Morality contains strong counterarguments against this and a variety of other objections.