Engaging Raz: Themes in Normative Philosophy is a posthumous Festschrift for Joseph Raz (1939–2022), collecting papers from “two highly selective, international conferences held in Raz’s honor after his passing.” It is a splendid volume: an entirely fitting tribute to, as its editors aptly write, a “towering figure in late twentieth century and early twenty-first century analytical philosophy”, whose work “profoundly influenced the discipline”.
The range of topics covered alone is a testament to the reach and significance of Raz’s contributions. There are essays, to give an incomplete list, on the relation between reasons and values, the nature of practical reason and action, exclusionary reasons, autonomy, the rule of law, the interest theory of rights, multiculturalism, and authority. It is also a striking, indirect testament to the reach and significance of Raz’s work how much, through no fault of the editors or contributors, the book leaves out. Two highly selective, international conferences and over 500 pages were not enough to allow for coverage of such topics as normative powers as such (although there are two excellent papers on promises and contracts), skepticism about the moral, criticism of the ideal of equality, the myth of instrumental reason, and incommensurability, among much else.
Many of the papers offer close readings of Raz’s work, most assess and develop Razian theses, and all engage with Razian themes. The result is a surprisingly cohesive volume; nothing feels shoehorned in. Each of the essays is of exceptionally high quality, from some of most distinguished thinkers in moral, political, and legal philosophy, as well as the philosophy of action, along with a few newer voices who, to judge from the strength of their contributions, will have much to teach us in coming years. None of the papers reads as dashed off or opportunistically unloaded. All are digestibly clear and concise. The joint effort and self-discipline of editors and contributors are remarkable; anyone who has edited or contributed to a collection of essays must marvel at how quickly the talks materialized on the shelf.
Many of the essays develop and advance, in conversation with Raz, their authors’ own ongoing work. Anyone interested in, for instance, T.M. Scanlon’s “buck-passing” account of goodness and value, Ralph Wedgwood’s attempts to reconcile ethics and decision theory, Elinor Mason’s notion of taking responsibility, Andrei Marmor’s elevation of accountability to philosophical attention, David Owens’s rethinking of the significance of commands, Massimo Renzo’s theory of alienated action, David Enoch’s distinction between “sovereignty” and “nonalienation”, or Daniel Viehoff’s fiduciary reading of the relation of state and citizen—and the list could go on—will want to read their essays.
Many of the essays, including some of those just listed, provide, directly or indirectly, opinionated surveys of the state of the art on Razian themes, along the lines of the most helpful handbook or encyclopedia entries. If someone with passing familiarity with Raz’s discussions of, say, exclusionary reasons, the rule of law, the interest theory of rights, multiculturalism, or the “adequacy” of an option set were to wonder, “Where has the debate gone since?” they could not do better than to read the papers on those subjects by Ulrike Heuer, Michael S. Moore, Emad H. Atiq, Kimberley Brownlee, Daniel Weinstock, and Steven Wall, respectively.
The wide-ranging nature of the collection would frustrate any attempt to engage with its content as a whole. So, I will confine myself to a question provoked by Enoch’s and Wall’s revisiting of Raz’s account of autonomy, presented in his seminal The Morality of Freedom. It is whether autonomy, as Raz articulates it, is really something of value, in the way that he suggests it is.
In Raz’s own words, the
ruling ideal behind the ideal of personal autonomy is that people should make their own lives. The autonomous person is a (part) author of his own life. The ideal of personal autonomy is the vision of people controlling, to some degree, their own destiny, fashioning it through successive decisions throughout their lives. (The Morality of Freedom, 369)
An autonomous life thus contrasts with “a life of no choices, or of drifting through life without ever exercising one’s capacity to choose” (The Morality of Freedom, 371). Enoch derives a natural methodology from this ideal, so described. In matters of autonomy, he suggests,
Whenever questions come up, whenever it is necessary to adjudicate between competing ways of filling in details, we should return to the underlying ideal, even if somewhat metaphorically put, and ask which way of filling in the details is more loyal to that underlying ideal. (247)
Let that be our methodology too.
There can be little debate that there is such an ideal, of an autonomous life. My question is whether one’s life necessarily goes worse for one insofar as one’s life does not realize that ideal. Of course, we need an “other things equal” qualification. And we might need to restrict our attention to life in cultural settings such as those of “western industrial societies” (The Morality of Freedom, 369). So, let us ask: other things equal and within such cultural settings, does one’s life go worse for one if and because one does not lead it autonomously, independently (as Wall clarifies, 273) of one’s attitudes toward living an autonomous life?
This is what I wonder. Imagine that someone leads the life that is otherwise best for them. It makes them happier, in a hedonic sense, than any other life would, and it is perfectly matched to their talents, so that they succeed in what they set out to do, more than they would in any other life. They willingly endorse it. But still this person has drifted into the life, or left it to chance, or was reared into it. To illustrate the last possibility, suppose that, from childhood, the siblings worked at the family business. As they reached adulthood, the others left the business for other things, something the parents wholeheartedly welcomed. But one sibling, content with the life they had, just continued in the business, doing each day what they had done the day before. While perfectly aware of alternatives—after all, the other siblings were pursuing them—this sibling, happy with what they had, never deliberated about whether to pursue such an alternative, never so much as to reject it.
Let us imagine further that this contented sibling enjoys the conditions for an autonomous life, even if, by hypothesis, they do not do anything further to make use of those conditions to lead an autonomous life. Those conditions, as Enoch lists them, are “appropriate mental abilities, an adequate range of options, and independence from coercion and manipulation” (248). Enoch and Wall do a real service in elaborating and amending these conditions. Enoch and Wall part ways with Raz in suggesting that the availability of even bad options can contribute to the autonomy of a life (253; 290), and Enoch goes so far as to suggest that the pursuit of a bad option can do so (258).
The last condition, of independence, that one is not coerced or manipulated into the life that one leads, reflects the fact that, as both Enoch and Wall note, leading an autonomous life is, at least in part, an interpersonal or, as Enoch puts it, a “relational”, matter. To lead an autonomous life is to lead it not subject to the will of another. Enoch and Wall observe (260; 293) that the adequacy of a range of options is itself in part a relational matter. Suppose that one is not coerced or manipulated into leading the life that one leads. To that extent, one is independent. Nevertheless, suppose, options have been removed from one’s menu (or, one might add, their costs increased) “intentionally” (Enoch) or by “unjustified interference” (Wall) (although perhaps without coercion). This seems more compromising to the autonomy of the life that we choose from the menu than if the same options were removed (or made more costly) by, say, natural forces or the uncoordinated, market choices of others. (Parenthetically, though, I’m a bit puzzled by Wall’s suggestion that this effect on our autonomy occurs only through interference that is unjustified on other grounds. One might have thought that the reason why such interference is unjustified is precisely that it had this effect on our autonomy.)
To these three conditions—capacities, options, and independence—Enoch adds a possible fourth, concerning “the conditions under which the preferences guiding the choice were shaped” (248). This references his paper “False Consciousness for Liberals, Part I: Consent, Autonomy, and Adaptive Preferences”, in which he argues, roughly, that when the preferences guiding the choice were shaped by injustice, the resulting life suffers from an autonomy deficit. This is another way in which one might live a life subject to the will of another.
So, in sum, there is a great deal of complexity and nuance in the conditions for autonomy. But imagine that these conditions are met. One is “living one’s best life”, as they say, one is not, in doing so, subject to the will of another, and one has an adequate range of options. Still, one has drifted into the life, or left it to chance, or was brought up into it. So, one is not living an autonomous life. While one “willingly endorses” one’s pursuits, this is not enough for autonomy, the ideal of which “transcends the conceptual point that personal well‐being is partly determined by success in willingly endorsed pursuits and holds the free choice of goals and relations as an essential ingredient of individual well‐being” (The Morality of Freedom, 369, reading this passage perhaps differently from Enoch at 249–250).
Recall that, following Enoch, our methodological lodestar in articulating the relevant value is the metaphor of authoring one’s life. And as we are imagining things, the metaphor does not fit. One is not the author of one’s life. One has simply let stand the text that one has found oneself with, as a biographical subject might let stand the offerings of a ghostwriter, rather than composing it oneself. As Wall writes, “they will not realize autonomy, even if they are very successful in realizing these other goods, if they do not pursue these other goods in certain ways and under the right conditions” (273), and while one has pursued these other goods “under the right conditions”, one has not pursued them in the “certain ways” that distinguish an autonomous life.
To be sure, there might be a kind of ideal that one does not realize, an achievement one has not achieved. But such is life. No one can realize all ideals or achieve all things. The question is whether one leads a worse life than they would if they stopped, deliberated, and chosen it. Is there reason to pity one for not doing so? Does someone else have reason to see to it that one chooses the life: to say, “Yes, I realize that this is the best life you could lead, but you really need to stop, deliberate about other options, and choose it, for its own sake—your well-being depends on it”? To insist on this, I worry, may be to betray a kind of fetish for planning or predilection for a studied way through life, which may not suit everyone. It is important that people live their lives under conditions of autonomy: with options and without being subject to the wills of others. But this is not because their lives are necessarily better if they are autonomously lived. Or so I speculate. In any event, if this collection leads us to return to Raz’s ideas with fresh eyes and new questions, then it is surely a success.