Catherine Elgin’s Epistemic Ecology is an important book. It is a wide-ranging tour of the central issues in epistemology, a tour that is anchored in the treatment of knowers as agents in their environments rather than spectators of those environments. According to Elgin, “autonomous agents extend, modify, and adapt to their environments, both natural and social, in order to frame and promote their epistemic ends” (3). It is in this sense that Elgin’s approach to epistemology is ecological: Epistemic Ecology consistently treats the activity of coming to know as a way in which epistemic agents relate to and cope with one another and to their natural environments.
In developing this ecological epistemology, Elgin relies on a number of key interconnected concepts, including ‘understanding’, ‘acceptance’, ‘commitment’, and ‘reflective equilibrium’. She applies these concepts seriatim to a variety of apparently distinct problems so as to articulate a unified holistic and internalist account. The issues in epistemology that Elgin focuses upon prominently include the autonomy and sociality of epistemic agents, testimony and the acceptance of testimony, the conditions on the reasonableness of disagreement, and the character and legitimate ends of teaching.
Significantly, Elgin’s ways of handling each of the various topics that she treats hang together with one another, and with her ecological approach to epistemology in general, in a reflective equilibrium of mutually supporting commitments, thus exemplifying the thesis of Epistemic Ecology. As the book has this overall structure of a set of mutually supporting commitments in reflective equilibrium, and the central node in this network is Elgin’s commitment to the ecological model of epistemology, the remainder of this review will focus on the most important implications of the ecological approach, and her reasons for accepting that model, rather than going through each of the topics discussed by Elgin.
Of the key concepts that she employs, ‘understanding’ is the most central. For Elgin, ‘understanding’ names the basic epistemic end of cognitive agents. She uses the word ‘understanding’ as both a noun and a verb:
An understanding of a topic is a network of commitments in reflective equilibrium. To understand a topic is to accept such a network—that is, to be willing and able to use it in non-trivial inferences and actions when one’s ends are cognitive. (231)
It is also central to Elgin’s concept of ‘understanding’, however, and thus to her ecological epistemology, that the commitments that are included in such networks of understanding include more than mere commitments to the truth of fact stating propositions, and that many of these additional elements that an epistemic agent accepts when she understands an area are neither true nor likely to lead to truth. An understanding of a topic
is a network of commitments that includes not just commitments about matters of fact but also acceptance of models, idealizations, and thought experiments that are known to diverge from the truth, as well as methods, norms, and standards that are not truth apt. (288)
That for Elgin the reflective equilibrium of a network of commitments that constitutes the understanding of a group of phenomena includes commitments to models, methods, norms, etc., that are apt to lead in turn to even greater understanding of those phenomena, but which themselves are neither true nor conducive to uncovering truths, leads to some of her most striking and distinctive claims. As a particularly telling example, in Epistemic Ecology, Elgin develops an extended account of her long-held position that models are best seen as “felicitous falsehoods”, misrepresentations that, suitably employed, enhance a more fruitful understanding of the phenomena that they represent.
In the course of developing that account, Elgin suggests that the felicitous falsehoods introduced by the sciences’ use of models are essential to those sciences, in that the epistemic end of science is better viewed as understanding, rather than as true and complete representation of the world.
I contend that models enable us to understand reality in ways that we would be unable to if we restricted ourselves to the unvarnished truth. The point is not just that the features that a model skirts can permissibly be neglected. They ought to be neglected. Too much information occludes patterns that figure in an understanding of the phenomena. The regularities a model reveals are real and informative. But many of them show up only under idealizing assumptions. (265)
A critic might think that there is a certain perversity involved in Elgin prioritizing understanding as the crucial end of inquiry rather than truth. After all, isn’t coming to know the world as it actually is the entire point of inquiring about the world, and doesn’t knowing the world as it actually is require coming to have a representation of the world that is true? The best that Elgin can promise for understanding, a critic might assert, is a reflective equilibrium of commitments that is productive in inference, action, and further understanding, but, for all that, quite possibly contains misrepresentations of the world. Elgin is sensitive to this concern, and addresses it directly in the course of providing reasons to accept her preferred ontological position, ‘constructive nominalism’. For Elgin, nominalism differs from realism in respect of their characterizations of what is involved in epistemic agents establishing the identity conditions on individuals and sorting those individuals into kinds.
To determine what there is we need to settle which differences matter, thereby marking out individuals, properties, and kinds…The issue that divides realists and nominalists is whether—or perhaps to what extent—such scientific work is creation or discovery. Do the scientists draw the lines, or do they discover where nature draws them? Realists maintain that nature draws the lines. The scientists and other investigators simply find what is there to be found. (248-249)
The nominalism that Elgin champions, on the other hand, is the “rejection of the idea that reality privileges any specific universals. All of the extensions are equally real…The kinds we recognize evolve in tandem with our emerging interest, methods, and resources” (244).
Elgin’s case for prioritizing understanding rather than truth as the central epistemic goal turns on her case in favor of constructive nominalism. If we should accept nominalism, then, arguably, what is epistemically important is understanding, which crucially involves the way that epistemic agents, in light of their interests and needs, carve the world into individuals, and sort those individuals into kinds, rather than faithfully and truly mirroring a hypothetical pre-existing structure of the world.
Elgin’s constructive nominalism is pervasive in Epistemic Ecology, but her most explicit consideration of the position appears in Chapter 10. Faithful to her commitment to the reflective equilibrium of a set of mutually supportive commitments as a primary epistemic virtue, Elgin’s case for constructive nominalism has the form of highlighting the role that it plays in the system of views she lays out in the other sections of the book, rather than a deductive argument.
Elgin begins this consideration by emphasizing her original starting point, the ecological model of epistemic agency. Knowers are organic agents that, as organisms, need to cope with and survive in their environments. As such, what is important to epistemic agents are those facets of the world that are relevant to their ability to interact successfully with their environment, a success condition which is fixed in detail by the kind of organism that they are and the specific character of their environment. One of the ways in which such coping takes place is through niche construction, the activity in which the agent not only adapts to its environment but also adapts that environment to its needs. So, the epistemic agent also has an interest in coming to understand how it might alter its particular environment so as to serve its other interests.
Organisms both adapt to an environment and alter the environment to make it a more suitable ecological niche. The choice of phenomena that epistemic agents seek to understand is a function of both the environment and the epistemic resources that epistemic agents bring to it. Epistemic agents adjust their interests to what is accessible, given their resources, and modify their resources as a result of the information they access. (241)
On Elgin’s account, finite epistemic agents are thus limited in their ability to access information about the world and selective concerning which information about the world they have an interest in accessing. But that world, according to Elgin, is fecund in regard to kinds. Although she doesn’t put the point in quite this way, on her view everything in the universe is both like and unlike everything else in the universe in an infinite number of ways, so there are also an infinite number of kinds. Any particular organism, however, only has the informational resources to access a limited set of similarities among individuals, and only a relatively small subset of all similarities is relevant to the needs and interests of any organism. So, taking the production of a complete and accurate representation of the world to be the legitimate end of inquiry is neither plausible nor, indeed, useful for finite epistemic agents.
Rather, it makes more epistemic sense to aim at an understanding of those similarities that help the agent to successfully navigate her environment, together with an understanding of the patterns of relationships among those similarities, the ways in which those similarities are related to and dependent upon one another. In coming to have such an understanding the agent comes to be able to leverage that understanding in successfully gaining access to the resources she needs from her environment and to reconstruct that environment in a manner that is beneficial to achieving her goals. As Elgin also points out, the similarities and patterns among similarities that are important for an epistemic agent might, or might not, align with those kinds that a physicist or chemist might think of as natural kinds. To cite one of Elgin’s examples, those individuals that fall into the kind ‘toxic to humans’ share very little physically or chemically, although coming to know which individuals fall into that kind is of great importance for any individual which happens to be a member of the set of humans.
Epistemic Ecology makes a compelling case for a distinctive and important way of thinking about epistemological issues. It does so by displaying how consistently applying an ecologically informed epistemological stance can help to provide illumination on a wide variety of issues in current epistemology, rather than by attempting to produce air-tight arguments for her position, or against her opponents’ views. Elgin’s writing style is remarkably lucid, and her treatment of alternative positions is always clear and fair-minded, even when she is critical. Epistemic Ecology is highly recommended.