This volume collects Crispin Wright’s work on relativism. It consists of 10 essays, all previously published (though one, ‘Alethic Pluralism, Deflationism, and Faultless Disagreement’, is revised and extended). The essays cover a wide range of topics: vagueness, matters of taste and inclination, epistemic modality, the open future, knowledge, truth. Many are reactions to what Wright calls ‘New Age Relativism’: the view, defended by John MacFarlane and others, that ‘our actual discourse, in certain regions of thought, displays patterns of which the best—empirically most adequate—semantic theory will make central use of a notion of relative truth’ (228). Wright contrasts New Age relativism with relativism construed as ‘a normative thesis: a thesis about the proper way to think about a certain subject matter and its claims to objectivity’ (228).
Several of the essays collected here are in smaller or larger part devoted to assessing the empirical evidence for New Age Relativism. But what makes Wright’s project distinctive is his approach to the normative thesis via the view of truth developed in his Truth and Objectivity (1992). Wright’s view of truth is minimalist in that it maintains that to be a truth predicate is just to satisfy certain platitudes (for example, that to assert something is to present it as true); it is pluralist in that it allows that there might be different ways of satisfying those platitudes for different discourses. (For example, it might be that truth for statements about empirical matters of fact is correspondence, but truth for statements about what is funny is superassertibility: the property ‘of being assertible in some ordinary, accessible state of information and then remaining so no matter what additions or improvements are made to it’ (72–3).) Wright is particularly interested in the idea of a merely minimally truth-apt area of discourse, as contrasted with a discourse that aims at correspondence to matters of fact. One marker of a merely minimally truth-apt area is that it will fail to satisfy cognitive command: roughly, the idea that a disagreement in that area must involve some cognitive shortcoming (such as one party or the other lacking information or having made some kind of error).
The fruits of this approach are exhibited in Wright’s treatment of ‘disputes of inclination’. These are ‘disagreements where one thinker apparently takes the view that P and another that not P, and where there is little plausibility in the idea that further information, or sophistication of relevant sensibility, could justifiably lead to an assessment of one view or the other as superior’ (229)—as when (for example) you and I attentively try the liquorice, and I judge that it is tasty, while you judge that it is not tasty at all. The New Age Relativist might propose to make sense of the phenomenon in something like the following way: suppose that the proposition that the liquorice is tasty is true or false only relative to an agent; and suppose that an agent A ought to assert a proposition only if it is true relative to A, and to evaluate an assertion (no matter who made it) as correct just in case the proposition asserted is true relative to A. This would go some way toward capturing the data. If I say that the liquorice is tasty, what I assert is true relative to me and hence the right thing for me to say. But since what I assert is false relative to you, you are right to evaluate my assertion as incorrect and reject it; the right thing for you to say is that the liquorice is not tasty. But Wright worries that such views do not deliver the result that our views are on par, that is, that neither is superior. I should judge my own view true and yours false, and hence my view as superior; you should judge your view superior (68, 234).
A truth predicate that fails to satisfy cognitive command seems precisely the kind of thing that is wanted to make sense of disputes of inclination as Wright characterises them. But there is an apparent problem. Simple reasoning suggests that an error-free dispute is impossible. Suppose that A accepts P and B accepts not-P, and suppose for reductio that the dispute is mistake-free. Suppose that it is in fact the case that P. Then B is making a mistake. So it must be the case that not-P. But then A is making a mistake. So, it’s not the case that the dispute is mistake-free; either A or B must be making a mistake.
Wright’s first step is to resist the inference exhibited in the last sentence of the previous paragraph: the move from the negation of it’s not the case that A is mistaken and it’s not the case that B is mistaken, to A is mistaken or B is mistaken. This inference requires double-negation elimination, and hence is not intuitionistically valid. But what could license rejecting classical logic in this kind of case? Wright suggests an analogy with intuitionistic mathematics. The intuitionist thinks that truth is provability. We cannot prove the Riemann hypothesis and we cannot prove its negation; what’s more, we have no reason to think that a proof of either is even possible. Therefore we have no license to assert that either the Riemann hypothesis or its negation is true. But we can derive a contradiction from the negation of the disjunction of the hypothesis and its negation; so we may assert the double negation of the disjunction. Analogously in the case of disputes of inclination: we have reason to think that any truths about what is tasty are knowable. (What sense could be made of the claim that there is a fact of the matter as to whether liquorice is tasty, but there is no way to know whether it is tasty?) But it’s at least possible that we would also have no reason to believe in a particular disputed case that we can come to know that one party or the other is right. For all we can establish, knowledge isn’t even possible. So we might come to know that it’s not the case that the dispute is mistake-free, but nevertheless have no license to assert the disjunction that either A is making a mistake or B is.
This is more or less where ‘On Being in a Quandary’—the earliest paper reprinted in the volume—rests. But subsequent papers dig deeper. We have seen how to resist the conclusion that either A or B is making a mistake. But we may feel that this falls short of the initial idea that our views are on par. After all, the intuitionist faces a similar issue as the New Age relativist with respect to the idea that our views are on par: I am committed to regarding your view as mistaken, you are committed to regarding mine as mistaken, and there is no point of view from which it will seem that neither is superior (232).
Wright sees worries of this kind as motivating exploration of what he calls a true relativism—the view that in disputes of this kind, the two parties genuinely disagree (the one is asserting the negation of what the other is asserting), but both parties are right. In particular, Wright asks, how must the true relativist conceive of propositional truth? Sure, the true relativist will say that truth depends on something like a stance, a perspective, or a set of standards. But exactly what philosophical conception of truth could support this claim? Not a correspondence theory: Wright argues that correspondence is essentially dyadic, with no room for a third term in the relation. So, propositional truth for the true relativist is not a matter of representing some worldly fact. (The point is developed in detail in ‘Relativism about Truth Itself: Haphazard Thoughts about the Very Idea’.)
Wright’s initial suggestion (in ‘Intuitionism, Realism, Relativism, and Rhubarb’) is that relative truth might be a matter of superassertibility. Superassertibility is, at least in principle, a feature a proposition can have relative to one state of information and lack relative to another; so it has the right shape to be a kind of relative truth. I can assert that liquorice is tasty if I like its taste; if we grant that the information that you don’t like it does not defeat my license to assert that it’s tasty, then it is plausible that it is superassertible for me that liquorice is tasty. But one might still wonder: if I say that liquorice is tasty and you say that it isn’t, are you and I really disagreeing? What reason do we have to think that what I assert is incompatible with what you assert? Here Wright appeals to a conceptual role theory: we agree that liking liquorice is grounds to accept that liquorice is tasty, and we agree that the consequences of accepting it include such attitudes as assigning a high priority to buying liquorice, accepting liquorice if it is offered, and so on. This agreement in conceptual role, Wright suggests, could help make it plausible that we ‘have genuinely conflicting views about a single proposition’ (74).
This is one of several places in the volume where a path is gestured at without being developed in detail, and it isn’t clear (to me at least) that a proposal along these lines could be made to work. Why should we accept that we have contrasting attitudes toward a single proposition with a common conceptual role, rather than maintaining that my attitude is toward a proposition, acceptance of which involves assigning high priority to buying liquorice for me, while your attitude is toward a different proposition, acceptance of which would involve assigning a high priority to buying liquorice for you?
In ‘Alethic Pluralism, Deflationism, and Faultless Disagreement’, Wright rejects the move towards relativism on the grounds that his pluralist view of truth allows for other possibilities. In particular, it can make room for a situation in which the norms relevant to a discourse mandate that I assert that the liquorice is tasty and that you assert that it is not, but in which there is no external standard of correctness (such as correspondence to an independent reality). In this case, Wright thinks, I will be committed to thinking that your claim is false, and you will be committed to thinking that my claim is false; but we can construe falsehood in this domain in a deflated way, as carrying no implication of cognitive shortcoming, fault, or error. (Much of the paper aims to reconcile this idea with the ‘inflationary’ argument of Truth and Objectivity, which purports to show that the normative role of truth differs from the normative role of assertibility, so that the truth-predicate cannot simply be a ‘device of indirect endorsement and generalization’ (245) as deflationists maintain.) The volume ends with the suggestion that disputes of inclination can be handled via a deflated but non-relativised truth predicate.
Readers who are invested in Wright’s strategy of understanding debates about realism via a minimalist account of truth will not need my recommendation; they, like those interested in New Age Relativism, will likely be familiar with much of the material in the volume already. Still, there is value in having these papers collected, both because of the interest of Wright’s development of his programme, and because the normative issues about relativism continue to deserve attention.
REFERENCES
Wright, Crispin (1992). Truth and Objectivity. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.