Every version of Environmental Ethics I teach has featured Dale Jamieson’s Ethics and the Environment (first edition, 2008), so I was particularly excited to use the revised second edition last spring. It defies textbook conventions—no study questions, refreshingly concise, surprisingly affordable. Yet this “introduction” delivers far more than its modest title suggests.
The first part lays the foundations for the rest of the inquiry. The first chapter introduces the field: What are nature and the environment? What are its different scales (global, regional, local, human and nonhuman) and aspects (economic, technological, religious, aesthetic, ethical)? Chapter 2 outlines an account of human morality and chapters 3 and 4 deliver a very effective introduction to moral philosophy (metaethics and normative ethics).
The second part of the book deals with practical issues—humans and other animals (chapter 5), animal agriculture (chapter 6), the value of ecosystems, living things, and species (chapter 6), and conflicts (with a focus on California) (chapter 7).
The third part looks forward, envisioning “nature’s future” (chapter 10) and ways to live an ethical life in the Anthropocene (chapter 11). These chapters engage with climate change and duties to future generations, population and overconsumption, and the relation between individuals and collective action problems.
In Chapter 2, Jamieson lays out a plausible account of the nature, functions, and evolution of human morality from animal behavioral systems for regulating social interactions to a “system of social control” constrained by the “demand for reasons” and encompassing “the possibility of its own critique” (28). Jamieson then discusses three challenges to his naturalistic account of morality: theism, amoralism, and relativism, and finds each wanting.
Chapter 3 moves on to one of the two “major fields” of moral philosophy, metaethics, while chapter 4 deals with normative ethics. Briefly, Jamieson’s metaethical view is that “valuing is contextual, object-directed, and constrained by biology, psychology, and history” (58). The whole chapter is guided by a patient analysis of various statements such as “It is wrong to kill animals for food,” “Mountain gorillas are vegetarian” (vs. “Mountain gorillas are valuable”) and includes a sophisticated yet perfectly accessible discussion of realism, subjectivism, naturalism, and intrinsic value. Realism would have seemed the default position in the 1970s when a minority of philosophers were trying to establish that nature has value in its own right. Through a careful analysis of the practical functions of moral language, Jamieson eschews the default position and confronts “The fundamental challenge of metaethics”: “to provide an account that can explain [the] strange set of features that seems to characterize moral language”, features of both “fact-stating discourse” and “expressions of attitudes” (56). Jamieson’s solution lies in understanding valuing itself:
Valuing is a transaction between valuers and the world that implies both a subject and an object. . . .Once we see subjects and objects as essential to this valuing, then the fact that both subjects and objects constrain valuing comes into view. (56)
This deceptively simple view drives Jamieson’s approach to a wide range of issues and succeeds, in my view, in capturing the essential motivation of environmental concern without controversial metaphysical assumptions. Intrinsic value just is the result of a contextual process, constrained by reasons, of valuing certain things (people, animals, objects, places, and processes). Thus, we can “reconcile the object-relatedness of realism with the motivational insight of subjectivism.” (58) We end up with an attractive package. A non-realist moral pluralism that treats many kinds of nonhuman entities and processes as valuable non-instrumentally. The package is capacious enough to account for our duties to (or the intrinsic consideration of) rivers and desert ecosystems, goats and wildflowers, gorillas and chickens, while leaving enough wiggle room for tensions and conflicts to emerge, leaving the handling of those conflicts up to the very source of value and reasons: the imperfectly rational, meaning-seeking, cooperative creatures that we are.
Chapter 4 offers a concise, accessible overview of normative ethics: consequentialism, virtue ethics, Kantianism—sufficient grounding for subsequent practical applications, which can easily be supplemented in class. The central question is, how should I live? A question to which Jamieson returns in the last chapter.
Part two applies these metaethical foundations to practical issues. Chapters 5–7 cover animal ethics (Singer, Korsgaard, Regan), agricultural systems, and ecological values (biocentrism, ecocentrism, deep ecology). While selective, omitting virtue, care, capabilities, and relational approaches, Jamieson provides solid conceptual foundations instructors can supplement. Chapter 5 begins with a thorough critique of speciesism, structured around entertaining thought experiments. This revised edition also contains an expanded discussion of animal agriculture, a combination of facts and theory (including an excellent discussion of conscientious omnivores and Singer’s replaceability argument), placed right at the center of the book. The bulk of theories besides sentientism is confined to chapter 7. Anyone familiar with the history of environmental philosophy in North America knows that animal ethics has not always been welcome in its pages. Jamieson was among the primary architects of their reconciliation (see Jamieson, 2002), and this book gives pride of place to their convergence
Chapter 8 expands on Jamieson’s account of valuing to detail the plurality of our values (prudential, cultural, aesthetic, and natural) and how they fit or clash with each other. This is, in my experience, an excellent chapter to prompt a nuanced and open-ended exploration of the value of nature with students. Its pivotal example is the termite mound: we value nature because and insofar as it is not a product of human influence.
Chapter 9’s California case studies is a new chapter, expanded from a previously briefer section. Highlighting the tensions between values and between types of organisms, it models epistemic humility and informed practical ethical thinking, as Jamieson adeptly weaves through the environmental, animal, and human interests at stake. We meet feral goats and endemic plants, tule elk and cattle, and bighorn sheep and mountain lions. This chapter can be used in many ways to apply concepts and theories from previous chapters to other conflicts one may have encountered.
A compelling picture emerges. We can see how conceiving of valuing as “contextual, object-directed, and constrained by biology, psychology, and history,” as well as “constrained by reasons,” has made room for a plurality of, and subsequently conflicts between, values. This is because many of these conflicting attitudes are reasonable and the types of things we find valuable in nature do not easily fit within a single value framework.
The book ends with looking towards the future and echoes Jamieson’s own 2014 work on the climate crisis, the Anthropocene, and moral progress. Chapter 10 addresses climate change, justice across nations and generations, and the compounding effects of population, affluence, and technology. Jamieson envisions three broad scenarios for what the future holds: “environmental catastrophe; continuing and increasing global inequality and environmental degradation; or a change in the way of life of the world’s most privileged people”, leaving it open which one (or combination thereof) is likely to unfold. The answer lies partly in the difference we can make, where “we” denotes both each of us individually and all of us collectively. This is the task of the final chapter.
How can we live a meaningful life in the face of disasters and irreversible change? Jamieson’s ethic for the Anthropocene reflects his green-virtue-consequentialism: making the world better entails reducing our environmental impact; in practice: “living car-free, avoiding airplane travel, eating a plant-based diet, and having fewer children. . . .How onerous (or not) these choices are depends on individual circumstance”, and most of these are not “all-or-nothing decisions” (239). Moreover, individual behavior is not enough; an ethical life will support laws and policies that enable ethical behavior. All of the required behavioral changes are within reach of most citizens in affluent nations, though the whole package ends up quite demanding. Jamieson recognizes that having no or few children is “the most difficult of these choices for many people”. Whether or not it will be required by a sustainable future, children remain a crucial source of meaning for many people. If the Anthropocene requires that we have fewer or none, in this respect it really threatens our ability to live meaningful lives. But by reducing our footprint, we preserve a world in which our descendants can do so. Impartiality across time requires such trade-offs. Still, having children, unlike conspicuous consumption, frivolous travel, and the standard American diet, is less a luxury than an essential part of the good life across cultures.
One could also argue that it is practically impossible for many people in America to live a car-free life (if only for work and groceries) or to avoid air travel (if only to visit family), but this is where our obligation to support infrastructure and policy kicks in, and where progressive consequentialism cuts us some slack: take the bus (when you can), car-pool (if you can), skip faraway conferences (you can) (See Jamieson and Elliot, 2009). Likewise with meat (do what you can, gradually).
Jamieson’s final chapters underplay recent evidence for decoupling economic growth from carbon emissions (see e.g., Ritchie 2024). He is right to hold that affluent populations drive a carbon-based economy. But decoupling suggests the lever may not be affluence or population but technology. Moderation is no doubt a green virtue, and maybe we should think twice about having yet more children who will consume plastic, fossil fuels, and meat like the average American. Still, an ageing population is less likely to be equipped to address the wicked problems of the Anthropocene. We need more, not fewer, kids who will one day read Jamieson and make the world better. I am thus both more optimistic than Jamieson (past contributors to climate change need not be future contributors) and more pessimistic (human behavior and norms are recalcitrant, making his ethic quite demanding).
Jamieson has offered us an impressively up-to-date an introduction to ethics and major environmental issues, and a spirited defense of a meaningful life in the Anthropocene. He succeeds brilliantly in introducing students, who may know nothing of Mill, Kant, Singer, Leopold, or the naturalistic fallacy, to ethics, environmental philosophy, and the challenges of the Anthropocene. His metaethical framework provides a robust and dynamic backbone to the inquiry. This is philosophy at its pedagogical finest: accessible yet sophisticated, practical yet profound.
REFERENCES
Jamieson, Dale. Morality’s Progress: Essays on Humans, Other Animals, and the Rest of Nature. New York: Oxford University Press, 2002.
Jamieson, Dale. Reason in a Dark Time: Why the Struggle Against Climate Change Failed—and What It Means for Our Future. Oxford University Press, 2014.
Jamieson, Dale, and Robert Elliot. “Progressive Consequentialism.” Philosophical Perspectives 23, no. 1 (2009): 241–51.
Ritchie, Hannah. Not the End of the World: How We Can Be the First Generation to Build a Sustainable Planet. Little Brown Spark, 2024.