Jeff King has written an outstanding book on an important and challenging topic, one that manages to bring more clarity and structure to the subject matter it addresses than one would have thought possible. The book is carefully argued and provides detailed analyses of a wide range of interesting data concerning context-sensitive constructions, including tense, definite descriptions, and demonstrative pronouns.
Since quite a lot happens in this slender volume, I’ll limit my discussion to the first half of the book (Chapters 1–3), where King lays out the theoretical core of his account; a full discussion of the second half (Chapters 4–6) is not possible in the space of a brief review. In the book’s later chapters, King offers a detailed account of how his picture applies to embedded constructions (Chapter 4), an in-depth discussion of the conditions under which a context can be said to be “appropriate” for a particular LF (or “Logical Form”), and a case study of definite descriptions and possessives (Chapter 6). Though I will not be discussing these later chapters in this review, they are well worth careful study.
Imagine you are at the beach with a friend watching a group of surfers in the distance. You turn to your friend and say:
1. Those guys are good.
As King argues, it is easy to imagine that nothing in the context—including your referential intentions—“determines a unique group of surfers as the semantic value in context of ‘Those guys’” (3). But, even if there is only a “range of overlapping groups that are legitimate candidates for being the semantic value in context of ‘Those guys’” (3)—e.g., (a), (b)—and nothing to choose between them—your utterance may nevertheless be ‘felicitous’:
1a. those guys = Abe, Bob, Cindy, Maria, Zeke, or
1b. those guys = Abe, Bob, Cindy, Maria, Sid…
That is, even if the semantic value of the demonstrative is left underspecified, your audience will nonetheless find your utterance “impeccably acceptable.” Understanding your utterance seemingly doesn’t require deciding on any unique semantic value for the demonstrative.
King rightly suggests that felicitous underspecification can arise for virtually any utterance containing a “supplementive” (1)—i.e., any expression whose context-invariant meaning doesn’t “secure” a semantic value in context. The phenomenon, as he notes, is ubiquitous.
On King’s picture, in cases of felicitous underspecification, supplementives—words that require contextual supplementation—get associated with a range of semantic values. Hence, for each semantic value within that range, there will be a corresponding “propositional candidate” associated with the utterance in which it occurs (11). But how, given a range of propositional candidates associated with an utterance such as (1), should the speaker and hearer move forward? How, King asks, does such an utterance affect the common ground between them?
King assumes a familiar Stalnakerian framework, which identifies a proposition with a set of possible worlds and which assumes a notion of common ground, defined as the set of worlds in which all of the mutually believed propositions are true (call this set the “context set”). In these terms, King’s question becomes: how does an utterance exhibiting felicitous underspecification “update” the context set?
Suppose we make the “slight idealization” that the relevant range of propositional candidates are mutual knowledge between the speaker and her audience (7). If so, how should the audience decide among the range of candidates? On King’s proposal, the answer depends on the current configuration of the common ground together with the immediate question under discussion: The options are to conjoin the candidates, disjoin them, or just “take your pick.”
King proposes the following update principle:
Felicitous underspecified update (FUU): Given c’s context set cs, update cs with the weakest candidate propositional update U for φ in c, if any, such that: (1) it gives a partial answer to the immediate question under discussion while adhering to Gricean maxims and not being ruled out by the common ground; and (2) no stronger candidate propositional update for φ in c gives a better answer to the immediate question under discussion than does U. (39)
Craige Roberts’ (2012) notion of a “question under discussion” (“QUD”) appealed to here has two especially important features. First, a question counts as a QUD just in case speaker and audience are mutually intending to answer it. Second, an answer φ to a question α in context c is “a better answer” to α than is ψ in c iff φ together with the common ground in c (when φ is uttered) settles more of α’s q-alternatives than does ψ (9) (where a “q-alternative” is, roughly, the set of propositions that would answer, or help to answer, q).
The updates predicted by FUU will vary depending on the current state of the common ground and the QUD at issue. In some cases, the update is predicted to be the conjunction of the propositional candidates; in other cases, however, the prediction will be the disjunction of the candidates. And, in cases where each of the propositions within the relevant range would update the context set in exactly the same way, the prediction is what King calls a “doesn’t matter” update.
We are told that there is a range of candidates from which we construct the update. In King’s set-up, the common ground will contain the fact that U= {φ 1, …., φ n} are the available completions while FUU tells us how to construct the update from U. But what determines U?
In Chapter 3, King addresses this, providing a metasemantic story regarding how the range of candidates is generated. The account offered is a generalization of the “coordination account” he has defended previously (2018):
The Generalized Coordination Account (GCA): The use of a supplementive σ in context c is associated with the range (set) R of candidate semantic values in c that uniquely satisfies each of the following conditions: (1) the speaker intends R to be the range of candidate semantic values associated with σ in c; and (2) a competent, attentive, reasonable hearer who knows the common ground of the conversation at the moment the speaker makes her utterance would know that the speaker intends R to be the range of candidate semantic values associated with σ in c.
Clause (2) is effectively a due diligence clause: the speaker needs to have done enough to put a competent, reasonable, etc., hearer in a position to recognize what she intends. Clause (1), however, needs unpacking. What is it “for a speaker to intend that a range R of candidate values in context c be associated” with a token supplementive (70)? King suggests:
[W]e can think of the speaker’s intention as ruling out everything except the members of R as candidate semantic values for σ in c. The speaker’s intention in such a case is indifferent as to whether any member of R is the semantic value of σ in c but rules out everything else as σ’s semantic value in c. (70)
While nothing outside the intended range would do, the speaker’s intentions exhibit a generality and indifference that precludes us from identifying anything within the range of candidates as the semantic value of σ.
Theorizing about linguistic communication in terms of “updates” to the common ground is unilluminating unless such talk can be shown to be straightforwardly reducible to the underlying facts regarding the context-invariant meaning of the speaker’s words, her communicatively relevant intentions and expectations, and the (potentially idiosyncratic) evidence that her audience uses in coming to recognize those intentions. Further clarity on these issues seems important not just for understanding King’s proposal, but also the more general philosophical significance of the phenomenon of “felicitous underspecification.”
Reconsider (1). Insofar as your utterance was literal, and communication seems to proceed smoothly, shouldn’t we expect to be able to identify what you asserted? After all, it might (at least initially) seem plausible that understanding an assertoric utterance requires successful recognition of what the speaker asserted. But what (if anything) do speakers assert in cases of felicitous underspecification?
King doesn’t say. While he raises this question, he explicitly refrains from trying to answer it. Rather, he claims that his project is to give an account of something that he claims might amount to the same thing—namely, how speakers and their audiences “update” the conversational common ground between them in cases of felicitous underspecification (5–6). Further, he says that he inclines towards thinking “that the proposition that conversational participants update with in such cases is what the speaker asserted” (6), but he does not defend that claim in the book.
But without further clarification regarding the connection between the updates predicted by FUU and what we assert, it’s difficult to fully assess its import. FUU cannot, for example, be understood as providing a truly “generative” account of what the speaker asserts in the relevant class of cases—at least not if we assume, as is natural, that assertion is, in part, grounded in the speaker’s meaning-intentions. The satisfaction of the conditions provided in FUU cannot make it the case(or even entail) that the speaker asserted anything.
Why? Notice that the relevant facts—that a particular update U best answers the question we were just discussing, isn’t ruled out by Gricean principles, etc.—cannot make it the case that I asserted U, since those facts cannot make it the case that I actually intended to communicate U. Facts about what I do, or do not, “speaker-mean”, are instead determined by (and only by) the facts about my psychological states, including my intentions and expectations.
Of course, the fact that U has those features (it best answers the QUD, etc.,) might make it an especially reasonable thing for your audience to take you have asserted, but that doesn’t guarantee that you did so assert, since it can’t guarantee anything about your communicative intentions. But maybe that is how we should understand FUU. Maybe it is not—and cannot—be understood as providing conditions, the satisfaction of which make it the case that you asserted/meant this or that. Rather, it is better understood, as a story about what a well-placed, competent hearer ought to take you to have asserted.
If we opt for this (less ambitious) understanding of FUU, we’d still need to make some further clarifications. For example, if FUU is construed as telling me, your audience, that I rationally must take you to be asserting U, since it’s the interpretative option that best answers the immediate QUD, then it runs afoul: utterance interpretation is always subject to the total evidence you have about the speaker, not just the (defeasible) evidence of the kind provided by the fact this or that interpretation would make them come out more cooperative, or informative, or as providing an answer to the question that you just asked her.
A more plausible take on FUU is even weaker: FUU tells your audience that they can reasonably take you as asserting the predicted update unless there is special reason for thinking otherwise. (For example, maybe I can reasonably take you as having asserted the conjunction of the candidates if it answers to conditions in FUU.) My inclination is to think of King’s proposal (FUU) in this way, but I remain uncertain.
On the one hand, we need a story about what (metaphysically) determines what you asserted; on the other, we need an epistemological story regarding how your audience came to successfully recognize the speech act you performed. Whether King’s proposal is better understood as a contribution to the latter, rather than the former, remains unclear to me. It would have been nice to have some further discussion regarding how, exactly, we should understand the talk of updates to the common ground as relating to the more fundamental facts concerning assertion, speaker-meaning, and the recovery thereof. It would have been helpful to hear more on this, especially for those who are less optimistic than King is about the prospects of identifying the results of FUU with what the speaker asserts.
One important topic gets almost no airtime in King’s discussion: namely, why does the phenomenon arise in the first place? King’s response is brief:
In a case of felicitous underspecification, that the conversational participants left open the candidate semantic values in context that they did suggests that conversational purposes at that point in the conversation are adequately served by associating a range of candidate semantic values in context with the supplementive and don’t require assigning it a unique semantic value in context. (37)
He adds that it is “precisely because of this, conversational participants construct a propositional update that involves all the candidate semantic values in context and that adequately serves conversational purposes.”
Yet, while we often don’t have any special practical interest in being more specific, that can’t be the whole of the story. More needs to be said about the conversational participants’ communicatively relevant goals and intentions. Part of the reason for this is that, in the sorts of cases that King focuses on—as well as those Anthony Gillies and Kai von Fintel (2013), John MacFarlane (2020a–c), and Ray Buchanan and Gary Ostertag (2005) have discussed—felicitous underspecification arises because a rational speaker simply cannot intend to communicate any one candidate to the exclusion of the others. And, if this is right, there are consequences for FUU, as well as the proposed metasemantic story King offers regarding the “range of candidates.”
To illustrate, consider a case of quantifier domain restriction (a phenomenon unaddressed in the book). While preparing for a party, Chet utters (2) to his fellow student, Tim:
2. Every beer is in the bucket.
What Chet asserted depends on the relevant domain restrictions on the quantifiers ‘every beer’ and ‘the bucket’. But, in this case, there are numerous, truth-conditionally inequivalent “candidates” for what the speaker asserted. For example:
P1. Every beer we bought at the bodega is in the bucket in the backyard.
P2. Every beer we will serve at the party is in the bucket with a pirate motif.
P3. Every beer in the apartment is in the bucket next to the hot tub.
But, as I argued (Buchanan 2010), even if (as is doubtful) the speaker had any one of these propositions “in mind” in uttering (2), he cannot not reasonably intend to communicate or assert it as opposed to any other of the candidates. After all, what we can reasonably intend is constrained by what we think we will be able to achieve by our efforts. But in a case like (2), the speaker cannot reasonably expect for his audience to recover any one of those candidates to the exclusion of the others on the basis of the evidence provided by his words in the context.
I suggest that the phenomenon of felicitous underspecification arises in part because the speaker cannot reasonably intend for their audience to entertain any particular candidate proposition to the exclusion of the other candidates in the context. Drilling down, this might sometimes be precisely because the speaker cannot reasonably intend for any one semantic value to be the one to supplement a particular context-sensitive element in the sentence uttered.
Return to (1) above. I artificially limited the candidate propositions to just two. But in any realistic case there will be many, many more. How could you reasonably intend any specific plurality to be the semantic value of ‘those guys’? I submit that you can’t, since you know in advance that the evidence you provide, by way of your words, your gestures, etc., will not put your audience in a position to entertain any one such plurality to the exclusion of the others.
If the foregoing is right, however, it raises difficulties for King’s proposal. Suppose that we continue with the idealization that the relevant range of candidates are mutual knowledge between speaker and hearer. Looking back to FUU, the picture we are offered is one on which the conversational update will consist in either (a) conjoining, (b) disjoining, or (c) taking one’s pick from the candidate propositions. But, if I’m right about why the phenomenon of felicitous underspecification arises in the first place, (a) and (b) start to look problematic. Suppose the range has 15 candidates, R1–R15. What exactly is so special about, for example, R1 & R2 &. . . R15 or the disjunction R1 v R2. . .R15? Is it more plausible to think that the speaker could be intending for her audience to coordinate on either of these particular constructions from the candidates, rather than say the conjunction/disjunction of the first, say, 12 of the candidates? And from the hearer’s side: must they come to entertain any specific such conjunction in order to understand the utterance? A potential concern here is that, from our current vantage point, the conjunctions/disjunctions of the candidates that King wants to identify with the relevant update might look to be just further candidates that the speaker did not specifically intend to convey.[1]
Perhaps King could argue that in this case we do have something to privilege his favored updates compared to the others that can be constructed from the range. If competent speakers somehow internalized King’s FUU and were guided by it in their linguistic production and comprehension maybe that would do the trick—the relevant conjunction/disjunction will glow, and will be differentiated from its peers, by the fact that it is the one that answers to the update rule we are guided by (FUU). King does not argue for anything like this empirical claim in the current treatise, but I think it would help with the kind of worry we’ve been considering.[2]
ACKNOWLEDGMENTS
This review is part of a longer piece I gave at an Author Meets Critics session at the 2024 Eastern APA. I’d like to thank Jeff, my “co-critic”, Craige Roberts, as well as the audience on that occasion. I would also like to thank Sam Bertsler, Josh Dever, Dan Harris, Jon Litland, Henry Schiller, Stephen Schiffer, and especially Gary Ostertag for helpful discussion of these topics.
REFERENCES
Buchanan, R. (2010): A puzzle about meaning and communication. Noûs 44 (2): 340–371.
Buchanan, R. and Ostertag, G. (2005): Has the problem of incompleteness rested on a mistake? Mind 114 (456): 889–913.
Gillies, T. and von Fintel, K. (2011): ‘Might’ made right. In Egan, A. and Weatherson, B. (eds.), Epistemic Modality. Oxford University Press, 108–130.
King, J. (2018): Strong contextual felicity and felicitous underspecification. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 97 (3): 631–657.
MacFarlane, J. (2020a): Indeterminacy as indecision, Lecture I: Vagueness and Communication Journal of Philosophy 117 (11/12): 593–616.
MacFarlane, J. (2020b): Indeterminacy as indecision, Lecture II: Seeing through the Clouds Journal of Philosophy 117 (11/12): 617–642.
MacFarlane, J. (2020c): Indeterminacy as indecision, Lecture III: Indeterminacy as Indecision. Journal of Philosophy 117 (11/12): 643–667.
Roberts, C. (2012). Information structure: towards an integrated formal theory of pragmatics. Semantics and Pragmatics. https://doi.org/10.3765/sp.5.6
[1] See Buchanan and Ostertag (2005). Note that further complications arise from the fact that it will almost always be vague what the relevant candidate propositions are in the first place. As such, it is unclear how to make literal sense of conjoining or disjoining the candidates. I do not have space to pursue this worry here.