Among the first things one typically learns about Fichte is that he dubbed his philosophical system “the first system of freedom,” on the grounds that it frees us “from those external influences with which all previous systems—including the Kantian—have more or less fettered man” (1988, 385). Far less often acknowledged, let alone thoroughly researched, are such claims as this: “all free actions are predestined through reason for all eternity – i.e., outside of all time” (2005, 216). To examine the content and justification of such claims, and thence to contend for their compatibility with Fichte’s commitment to freedom, is the challenge boldly taken up by Kienhow Goh in this remarkable new book.
Goh’s scholarship is exemplary, and his analyses and interpretations are incisive and provocative. He argues that, for deep systematic reasons, Fichte affirms “the predestination of all our free actions” (158) based upon idiosyncratic versions of both logical and theological determinism (170). On the former view, all truths regarding our actions must obtain a priori, which entails that all our actions are predetermined from eternity (165). And on the latter view, the rationality of moral agency depends upon the supersensible reality of an ordering principle—viz., “God”—that “determines every event in the world, including our actions” (171). Because he makes such a thorough case for this startling reading, Goh’s book demands careful consideration by anyone working seriously on Fichte or on the post-Kantian free will debate, and it should be of significant interest also to scholars of Kantian and post-Kantian philosophy more generally. For my part, I have found the book both highly illuminating and deeply (but productively) perplexing, in roughly equal measure.
In six chapters, Goh traces Fichte’s developing thinking from Aphorisms on Religion and Deism (1790) through The Vocation of Man (1800), with special attention to System of Ethics (1798). Chapter 1 traces the transformation of the free will debate through Kant’s Critical philosophy and its early reception. This will be familiar territory for some readers, but Goh provides an especially wide-ranging and fine-grained map of the terrain. After Kant, the debate no longer pits the freedom of the empirical self against the causal determinism of the sensible world; instead, possible barriers to self-determination are transposed onto the noumenal level or into the intelligible realm: a novel problem-space configured by the Third Antinomy, the Reciprocity Thesis, and Kant’s claim that all causality—including the spontaneous causality of the ‘free’ will—must be governed by immutable laws. Among those who first grappled with the implications, two opposing positions predominate: intelligible fatalism, a deterministic view which stresses the thoroughgoing lawfulness of reality (sensible/phenomenal and intelligible/noumenal), but which thereby seems to undermine moral imputation and invalidate the moral law; and transcendental indifferentism, which rescues imputation and obligation by reconceiving the will as an unconstrained, indeterministic power of choice, but which thereby seems to render acts of willing (un)intelligible only as products of pure chance.
Chapter 2 recounts Fichte’s first attempts to get to grips with all this, especially in the second edition of Attempt at a Critique of All Revelation (1793), which advances a theory of the will that seeks to reconcile freedom and lawfulness via a distinctly post-Kantian conception of self-determination. On this view, moral self-legislation is the first and most fundamental expression of freedom, but—contra Kant’s Reciprocity Thesis—it does not override the agent’s freedom of choice; hence, we are free to (imputably) shirk our moral obligations, but we are fully free, totally self-determining, only when we freely opt to honor them. Importantly for Goh, the Attempt also contains a broadly Kantian argument that the validity of the moral law is contingent upon the guaranteed realizability of the highest good within the sensible world. Thus, given that the sensible world’s ordering principles are causal laws, not moral requirements, there must exist a ‘higher legislation,’ divinely enforced, which ensures that what nature’s laws necessitate will finally harmonize with what the moral law demands. For Fichte, this higher law “subsumes and unifies both freedom and nature—in, as it were, a predetermined harmony of determinations through freedom with determinations through the laws of nature” (2001, 294). For Goh, this implies that “the will’s self-determining activity is based on, and derivative of, the ground of [that] preestablished harmony” (61).
Fichte’s broadly Kantian speculations about predetermination circa 1793 predate his breakthrough to the basic principles of the Wissenschaftslehre, and one therefore might wonder what role that concept can play within the distinctly post-Kantian ‘system of freedom’ that results. Chapter 3 gives us Goh’s answer: Fichte seeks to complete Kant’s Copernican revolution by, inter alia, “taking into consideration the role of practical reason in the constitution of experience”; and the resulting system “presents a seamless, totalizing system of morally necessitating grounds which. . .presupposes that all of our actions are preestablished outside of time, for all eternity” (69). On Fichte’s account of the transcendental role of the practical, felt constraint (broadly construed) is a precursor to cognized objecthood, and thus the ‘reality’ that mind-independent objects have for us ultimately consists in their specifically practical salience or significance, which derives from the essentially driven and inescapably limited nature of the finite rational subject (‘the I’). The I’s felt limitations evince “an original, determinate system of our boundedness in general,” expressed in an “original, determinate system of drives and feelings” (2005, 105); and from this, Goh infers that for Fichte, “original reality [is] determined from all eternity, outside of time” (90). To my mind, this rather resembles the intelligible fatalism of A. W. Rehberg, according to which the thoroughgoing determinacy of the sensible world is conditional upon that of its supersensible ground, but now with the Fichtean twist that the ordering principle of the supersensible realm is not the principle of sufficient reason, but the ‘higher legislation’ discussed above (cf. 93, 102)—which, on Goh’s account, entails that “our freely chosen (self-determined) actions and their consequences [are] factored into the determinacy of our original constitution” (91).
Textually, the latter claim is mainly motivated by a single passage from §7 of System of Ethics that rounds out a discussion of the proper format for transcendental-idealistic explanations of “the fact that our efficacy is limited” in this or that determinate way (2005, 97). Whereas a naturalistic account would strike bedrock in some further-inexplicable facts about an independent natural world, a complete transcendental account terminates in the fact that “This determinate rational being just happens to be so constituted that it has to limit itself in precisely this way” (2005, 97). Such is the runup to the first of Fichte’s 1798 invocations of predestination, which reads as follows:
If we now combine all of these individual limitations, which occur as such only in time, and if we think of them as [our] original constitution prior to all time and outside of all time, we are then thinking the absolute limits of the original drive itself [. . . .] Our entire world, our inner as well as our outer world (only insofar as the former actually is a world), is thereby pre-established for us for all eternity. I said “only insofar as [the inner world] actually is a world,” i.e., insofar as it is something objective within us. What is merely subjective, i.e., self-determination, is not pre-established; hence we act freely. (2005, 97–98).
Given the transcendental ideality of time, the particular limitations that we apprehend over time and sequentially must, in reality, characterize us all at once and eternally. Still, one thing Fichte does not say here—and which his closing sentence seems to deny—is that the actions whereby we strive to surmount such limitations are likewise predetermined. Nevertheless, Goh has good reasons for concluding that those actions, too, must be fixed from eternity. Consider: for any moment in time, the situation in which you find yourself (which, reduced to its transcendental essentials, means: the specific limitations on your powers apparent to you at that moment) is partly a consequence of your own past actions. Hence, because your finding yourself in any given situation (in the sense just specified) was predestined from eternity (given the transcendental ideality of time), so, too, was any action that was a necessary condition for your finding yourself in that situation.
The difficulty, however, is that Fichte seems not to accept that consequence, instead concluding §7 thus: “self-determination is not pre-established; hence we act freely” (2005, 98, emphasis added). The passage’s prima facie upshot, therefore, is this: the environing world that the I posits in response to its original limitations is (to just that extent) ‘pre-established’ by those limitations—but this does not curtail one’s (indeterministic) freedom to choose from among the pre-established options, and therefore does not predetermine one’s actions. Granted, Goh’s account provides some reasons for doubting that picture’s coherence—but I think the text gives us some reasons to be skeptical of Goh’s reading. For one, the (equivocal) passage under discussion is one of only two in System of Ethics that mention predestination. The second mention occurs in §18.III.h—but as Goh notes (176), Fichte soon disavowed that section’s speculations, in favor of an alternative account in Book III of The Vocation of Man. To my mind, this makes it doubly questionable whether the passage at issue suffices to securely ground Goh’s interpretation. I hasten to add, however, that his reading also derives support from important conceptual considerations drawn from across Fichte’s corpus.
Chapters 4 and 5 largely set aside the issue of predestination, instead offering thorough analyses of the theory of freedom articulated in System of Ethics. In Chapter 6, the topic of predestination resurfaces. After critically appraising the aforementioned, abortive speculations in System of Ethics, Goh turns to On Our Belief in the Divine Governance of the World (1798) and The Vocation of Man (1800), in which Fichte postulates an all-embracing, quasi-divine ‘moral word order’ which he (notoriously) identifies with God. Fichte’s overarching contention here is that we need to postulate God, not in order to explain the existence of the sensible world, but in order to secure the validity of the moral law, by ensuring the achievability of morality’s ultimate goal. God is understood to provide that guarantee in an essentially twofold way: first, by ensuring that we always find ourselves in a position to advance toward morality’s ultimate goal (which God does by engendering our drives and limitations accordingly); and, second, by ensuring that genuine progress results from every dutiful attempt to so advance (which God does by superintending a supersensible, spiritual realm accordingly—given that, in the sensible world, our best efforts often backfire or fall flat). Still, as Goh acknowledges, the terms “predestination” and “predetermination” do not appear in either of these two texts; nevertheless, Goh suggests, Fichte’s depiction of God’s role in sustaining (indeed, being) the eternal world plan, and thus shaping humanity’s destiny, imply that “predetermination and predestination remain a part of Fichte’s view of original reality” (181), such that “God determines every event in the world, including our actions” (171).
I have come to believe that Goh is almost certainly right about that, subject to one important qualification. What Goh offers us, I think, is a convincing account of the conception of ‘original reality,’ and of our relation thereto, toward which Fichte is definitely heading during the Jena period but at which, as of 1800, he has not yet confidently arrived. Put another way, I think Goh offers a compelling account of ‘what Fichte should have said’ on that subject, but which he was not yet able to affirm unequivocally, mainly owing to the narrowly egological and moralistic framing of his system in the Jena years—from which he retreated after 1800, but which until then led him to (over)emphasize the self in self-determination, the subject in subject-objectivity, and the idealism in ideal-realism. These imbalances are pointedly redressed after 1800—but not so much before then, which means that Goh’s interpretation tends, in places, to bend the first main phase of Fichte’s thought out of shape. Still, it is to Goh’s credit that to substantiate that criticism would require a great deal of difficult exegetical and conceptual work—just the sort of thing that has borne so much fruit in this truly terrific book.
REFERENCES
Fichte, J. G. (1988), Early Philosophical Writings, trans. and ed. Daniel Breazeale, Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
Fichte, J. G. (2001), “Review of Leonhard Creuzer, Skeptical Reflections on the Freedom of the Will, with Reference to the Latest Theories of the Same, with a Foreword by Professor Schmid,” trans. Daniel Breazeale, Philosophical Forum (32:4), 289–296.
Fichte, J. G. (2005), The System of Ethics, trans. and ed. Daniel Breazeale and Günter Zöller, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.