Friendship for Virtue

Some thinkers are attracted to the philosophy of friendship because of their interest in the best possibilities of friendship while others are interested in the whole shebang, virtuous and unvirtuous. Kristjan Kristjánsson falls in the middle, as he takes Aristotelian character friendship as his topic, yet has a rather expansive view of this category. Readers who are accustomed to thinking of character friendship as friendship based in mutual love of each other’s virtuous character may be surprised by Kristjánsson’s conception that allows character friendship between “learners,” between children and parents and between people unequal in virtue and social position. The focus on close friendships between people who are “good enough” to aid in another’s moral development aligns the book’s arguments with commonly held views while putting them in tension with what I take to be the most natural reading of the text.^[1]

Kristjánsson describes his project as an “updated and reconstructed neo-Aristotelian account of friendship” (11). As a Kant scholar who appreciates and produces work in Kantian ethics that departs very significantly from Kant’s own theory, I am sympathetic to the author’s approach. Yet this book raises the same methodological questions that I often have about the role that Aristotle’s theory plays in contemporary accounts of friendship that appeal to Aristotle. How much of Aristotle is relevant? Kristjánsson states that we do not need Aristotle’s entire framework in order to appreciate his insights on friendship (2), but as the book progressed, I found myself wishing for more clarity and consistency about exactly which elements of Aristotle’s account are relevant to the author’s aims and why. Aristotle’s full theory of virtue and character development and the details of his arguments are very important in chapters 3, 4 and 5, but seem to largely fall away in chapters 7 and 8.

Chapters 3, 4 and 5 are of particular interest for readers who are invested in both Aristotle interpretation and in contemporary debates in the philosophy of friendship. Chapter 3 offers an interpretation of phronesis as an “intellectual filter” that i) integrates critical thought into well cultivated emotional dispositions and ii) guides deliberation in cases involving the interplay of multiple virtues (74). Kristjánsson frames this interpretation in terms of a response to Bernard Williams’s famous “one thought too many” argument, which adds a lot of complication for readers who do not regularly wade in the weeds of moral theory but promises a further layer of analysis for those who do. Kristjánsson conceives of phronesis as an intellectual virtue that develops after the emotions have been aligned with virtue through habituation. On this picture, two people are eligible for a character friendship after successful emotional formation and they help each other attain full virtue by refining each other’s phronesis. This view will not appeal to those who understand the development of Aristotelian virtue in terms of the integration of thought and feeling. As Paula Gottlieb argues, “There is not an emotional stage followed by a cognitive stage, as described in the Magna Moralia, but an integrated process, by which the learner comes to have both virtue of character and practical wisdom” (42–43).

Nevertheless, Kristjánsson’s discussion of phronesis effectively shows that an intuitionist-style interpretation of Aristotle that emphasizes spontaneity and a rather loosey-goosey version of agent-relativity does not yield a more appealing account of friendship. Having excellent judgment makes a person more trustworthy and thus a better friend than having a willingness to do foolish or unjust things at the friend’s behest.

In Chapter 4 Kristjánsson seeks to reconcile moralized (i.e., characterologically grounded) views of friendship, such as Aristotle’s, with aestheticized views, such as the one defended by Alexander Nehamas in On Friendship (2016). For Nehamas, our love for a friend is directed at the friend’s whole way of being, as opposed to a specifiable set of good traits. This is an attractive view—certainly we do love our best friends for their individuality—but on the other hand most of us are not enamored with others’ really morally ugly traits. In order to integrate an element of the aestheticized view into a moralized account, Kristjánsson highlights the way in which Aristotelian virtue is highly individualized: “there is no description of an individual’s virtue repertoire available to us that abstracts from its instantiation in that person in all her psycho-social uniqueness. There is no unique blueprint of the perfectly virtuous person per se to aim for” (106). Hence, two virtuous people are not interchangeable, and the friend’s lovable quirkiness is not somehow distinct from her way of manifesting virtue. I love the way this explanation re-enchants and re-personalizes the moralized view of friendship. I look forward to teaching this chapter in a future course.

I expect some readers will not be fully convinced by Kristjánsson’s argument for the claim that the vicious cannot form close friendships, which relies on an appeal to the psychology of vice. According to Aristotle, vicious people are inherently inconsistent and hence cannot be counted on to reliably remain honest, loyal, and caring to another person. Kristjánsson acknowledges that Aristotle creates ambiguity by lumping the merely flawed together with the truly malicious when he speaks of the vicious, but I think this ambiguity would need to be clarified in order to robustly defend the claim that bad people cannot form close friendships. Without knowing what kind and depth of moral badness makes a person too incoherent to meet the minimum standards of such a friendship, it is hard to evaluate the claim. Consider, for example, the friendship between the main characters in the Netflix show Dead to Me, Jen and Judy. Judy crashes into a car and drives away and Jen smashes a man’s head with a ceramic bird, leaves him to drown in a pool and (together with Judy) dumps his body in the woods. TV writers and audiences find it easy to imagine a sister-like bond between these two deeply flawed characters. Perhaps the drama draws us into a psychology as fantastical as the plot, but I think those who do not already share Kristjánsson’s view will wish for more argument and discussion of an alleged counterexample like this one.

Chapter 5 is the centerpiece of the book in that it offers an argument for the claim referenced by the book’s title, Friendship for Virtue. According to Kristjánsson, the aim of character friendship “is not the love of character per se, but loving it in the service of mutual character development” (112). Although moral education is not an explicit motivation for forming or sustaining a character friendship, it is the underlying purpose (114). This claim sets the stage for a useful discussion of the mechanisms of learning from character friends and an analysis of the dissolution of character friendships that pushes against some of the more idealized aspects of Aristotle’s account. Friendship “scaffolds” character development through mutual trust, critical engagement and forms of self-knowledge made possible by relationship with “another self”. The section on these mechanisms spans 5 pages, but each is rich enough to support a whole chapter.

Kristjánsson makes fine use of Meg Wolizer’s novel The Interestings (2014) as an illustration of how a character friendship may dissolve when the friends’ developmental paths diverge such that the relationship loses its moral-educational potential even though both friends retain their virtue. This argument was canvassed in Chapter 2, but it became much more compelling when supported by an example. I appreciate the challenge to Aristotle’s overly idealized stance on the inherent stability of character friendships posed by Kristjánsson.

Chapter 7 argues that Aristotelian character friendship is possible between two people who interact solely through electronic means and have never met in person. Kristjánsson reviews and critiques several arguments against online character friendships, but I will give particular attention to the geographical/ontological and epistemological argumentsbecause I consider them the most forceful. Friends who never meet in person clearly do not ‘live together’ in the sense that Aristotle identifies as a condition of character friendship. Further, they are not able to directly perceive each other’s actions; rather, everything that the online friend knows about her friend’s actions and experiences is “filtered” through the friend’s interpretation. Kristjánsson dismisses these considerations based on the ideas that 1) sharing thoughts is really the most important form of shared activity for Aristotle and 2) direct perception of another’s character is not possible so our understanding of a friend is always filtered anyway.

My dissatisfaction with these responses stems from what I take to be a fairly fundamental disagreement that I have with the author about the process by which one comes to know another person’s character in Aristotle’s sense. On my view, one must be able to observe a person’s actions across many different circumstances and across time in order to know their character. Things like going to the gymnasium with the friend do not matter just because they are ways of sharing physical space; shared activities matter because they are occasions for learning how the friend responds to both you and others through choices and interactions across a variety of life circumstances and challenges. Knowing the thoughts a person chooses to disclose to you cannot provide that fullness.

Thus, the possibility of fully online character friendships really turns on the epistemological argument. This argument emphasizes the limited information that online communication conveys about a person’s character and the increased opportunities for deception. Kristjansson argues against the “positive bias toward the body as more revelatory of who we are” (164). Here there is a tension between the author’s view of online friendships and his commitment to naturalism. We are embodied beings. It is just a fact that we communicate through our bodies and our privileging of in-person communication and interaction seems to be explained by the rich and unmediated information they provide.^[2]

I am very different from the author, but I think that it is important to respect his testimony about his own experience. Kristjánsson’s articulation of the deep personal significance of his own online friendships is more powerful than the theoretical points that he makes in supporting his stance on the possibility of online character friendships. He feels most himself online (165). Digital communication allows many people freedom from social anxiety and inhibition and some media also allow for long, carefully articulated reflections that in-person conversation does not typically support. I acknowledge this reality and I too hold dear some of my email communication. Nevertheless, I cannot see a completely online friendship as an Aristotelian character friendship. Aristotle’s conception of knowing another’s character has a fullness that the depth of heartfelt written correspondence cannot approximate in the absence of a grounding in past experience of “living with” the friend.

Although I do not wish to endorse this view, I don’t think Aristotle would have any trouble saying that people who struggle with in-person interactions have a deficiency that limits their access to flourishing. It would be interesting to see how Kristjánsson might draw on developments in disability studies to bolster his argument against “body bias,” though again it seems that some of this “bias” may be required by naturalism. The speculations at the end of chapter 7 about video games as “vehicles for character friendship” veered very far away from the author’s testimony and the compelling example of Catherine the Great’s correspondence with Voltaire. Chapter 8 includes a slate of further sociological speculations and recommendations for educational applications that I find dubious or wrong. I hope that productive collaboration between philosophers, psychologists, and educators is possible, but I think the author is at his best on philosophical terrain in this particular project.

Kristjánsson ends the book with a list of suggestions for further interdisciplinary work in the study of friendship. I would add a suggestion for more intradisciplinary dialogue within philosophy on the topic of friendship. Trust, critical engagement, and self-knowledge are all key elements of Kant’s account of moral friendship in the Doctrine of Virtue. Here I think Kristjánsson would find much to agree with and elaborate on, just as this Kantian benefited from reading his Aristotelian account. In addition to tight argumentation and thorough engagement with the relevant literature, traditional virtues of academic scholarship, Friendship for Virtue exhibits expansive curiosity, sincere reflection, and attention to the world. Kristjánsson’s gratitude to his friends shines through and his central argument gives us a very good reason for feeling the same about our own.

REFERENCES

J.M. Cooper, “Aristotle on the forms of friendship,” Review of Metaphysics, 30(4), 1977, 619–48.

Paula Gottlieb, Aristotle on Thought and Feeling, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2021.

M. T. McFall, “Real character-friends: Aristotelian friendship, living together, and technology,” Ethics and Information Technology, 14(3), 2012, 221–30.