Grounding in Medieval Philosophy

In contemporary metaphysics, the term grounding has come to be used to pick out a certain kind of non-causal priority or explanation. Thus, when it is said that parts ground the whole, the claim is that parts are somehow prior to, and explanatory of, the whole, without the parts causing the whole in any obvious sense of the term. And when moral facts are said to be grounded in natural facts, the claim is that natural facts are in a sense prior to, and explanatory of, natural facts, without it being the case that the former act as a cause of the latter.

The recent interest in this phenomenon of non-causal priority or explanation is sometimes presented as part of what we might think of as a neo-Aristotelian turn in metaphysics (involving, among other things, a renewed appreciation of causal powers, and hylomorphic analyses of substances as compounds of matter and form). Thus, according to Jonathan Schaffer, metaphysicians ought to ask, not only the Quinean question of what there is, but also, and perhaps especially, the Aristotelian question of what grounds what, what is prior to what, or indeed what is fundamental:

On the now dominant Quinean view, metaphysics is about what there is. . .I will argue for a more traditional Aristotelian view, on which metaphysics is about what grounds what. Metaphysics so revived does not bother asking whether properties, meanings, and numbers exist. Of course they do! The question is whether or not they are fundamental. (Schaffer, 2009, 347)

But while the Aristotelian ancestry of the concern for the question of what grounds what is recognized, the history of the concept of grounding or non-causal explanation remains little-studied so far. The present volume aims to fill that lacuna by turning to Aristotle and the medieval Aristotelian tradition (2).

Given this aim, the broad scope of the volume, in terms of both topics and authors, is helpful. The first two contributions, by Riin Sirkel and Petter Sandstad, discuss the concepts of priority and formal causation as a non-efficient causal kind of explanation in Aristotle. The contributions by Paul Thom, Christopher Martin, Jacob Archambault, and Mikko Yrjönsuuri discuss grounding in connection with medieval logic, while the contributions of Thomas Ward and Stephan Schmid respectively discuss the grounding of moral goodness in Ockham and the way in which truth is founded on reality according to Suárez. Of course, there always remain things to be desired. Thus, while the volume features no contribution dedicated specifically to Scotus, a discussion of his concept of essential dependence as developed in De primo principio, for instance, would have made for a welcome addition.

Many contributions are written in such a way that they should be able to speak not only to an audience of specialists in medieval philosophy, but also to historically minded systematic metaphysicians as well. Good examples here include the contributions by Petter Sandstad and Stephan Schmid, which I will discuss in some further detail below. The discussion of Avicenna and Kit Fine on essences and the priority of essentiality over necessity by Paul Thom, too, bridges the gap between two bodies of literature in a helpful way (88–9). Jacob Archambault discusses the way in which fourteenth-century logicians sought to ground logical consequences in theories of supposition and reference, contrasting their approaches with more recent Tarskian ones. While this is a welcome project, for me this relatively short chapter was rather on the dense side. Archambault suggests that the way in which Ockham sought to ground logical consequence in personal supposition was ‘more novel than hitherto recognized’ (143) and that, philosophically, his approach provided the theory of consequence with ‘a surer foundation in reality at the price of leaving our grasp of it more opaque’ (143). These are intriguing claims, but I would have loved to see them developed in greater detail. Which aspects of consequence are left opaque by Ockham’s theory? And why think that earlier accounts ‘did better at explaining inferential practice’ (143)? Some more unpacking of the primary texts, ideally with examples, would have been welcome here.

As Magali Roques points out in her introductory chapter to the volume, an exploration of grounding in medieval philosophy faces the obvious challenge that the Aristotelian tradition lacked a single term corresponding to the modern concept of grounding (12). Still, as the contributions to this volume make clear, even if they lacked a single semantic marker for the phenomenon, Aristotle and his medieval followers took very seriously the idea of non-causal priority or explanation, and the terminology of grounding can be helpful for understanding the questions they were asking. Thus, as the contribution by Thomas Ward makes clear, we can think of Ockham as asking whether the goodness of a deed can be grounded in the divine will (225), and as Christopher Martin argues, in Abelard we find an attempt to ground logical entailment in ‘the metaphysical structure of the world’ (127) and in his ontology of essences in particular.

Of course, deploying a modern term of art in discussions of historical texts and authors brings with it a risk of anachronism. But here the contributors of the volume tread carefully, pointing out similarities as well as dissimilarities between grounding as understood today on the one hand and seemingly related notions from the Aristotelian tradition on the other. Thus, J.T. Paasch argues that we should probably not think of Ockham’s concept of natural priority as a kind of metaphysical grounding (199), and as Petter Sandstad points out, while it may be tempting to think of an Aristotelian form such as Triangle as grounding truths such that the isosceles has internal angles equal to two right angles, there are at least two significant differences between grounding as understood today and Aristotelian formal causation. First, while grounding is standardly treated as a relation between facts or states of affairs (one fact or states of affairs grounds another), the relation between the form Triangle and isosceles having internal angles equal to two right ones is cross-categorical (between a form on the one hand, and a fact or states of affairs on the other). Secondly, while grounding is transitive (if A grounds B, and B grounds C, A is a ground of C), transitivity fails in the case of formal causation: ‘in formal causation’, Sandstad writes, ‘there are no chains’, and ‘there are no cases where A is the formal cause of B, and B is the formal cause of C’ (75). As Sandstad points out, in being cross-categorical and non-transitive, formal causation is perhaps closer to truthmaking. Again, however, he warns that the analogy is imperfect: while truthmaking is a relation holding between portions of reality (to use David Armstrong’s phrase) and truthbearers, none of the relata in the given case of formal causation is a truthbearer.

To be sure, one could question some of the premises this analysis rests on. One could question, for instance, why grounding could not be cross-categorical, why grounding relations should hold between states of affairs only,^[1] or whether truthmaking should indeed be set apart from grounding.^[2] But to acknowledge this just is to acknowledge that the debate on grounding is ongoing, and that coming to terms with this special kind of priority remains a work in progress. Against that background, the systematic attempt in this contribution to situate the concept of formal causation vis-à-vis contemporary notions such as grounding and truthmaking strikes me as a very welcome one.

To the extent that historical views differ from contemporary ones, there may also be opportunities to learn from the past. This is a point emphasized in Stephan Schmid’s contribution on Suárez. According to Schmid the case of Suárez invites us to question whether grounding is indeed the unified phenomenon it is sometimes taken to be in modern debates. To develop this point, he considers two paradigmatic examples of grounding:

1. 1. Dispositions or powers are grounded in their categorical basis.
   2. The truth of the proposition or sentence ‘Snow is white’ is grounded in snow’s being white.

While these are often treated on a par as cases of non-causal priority or explanation, the treatment that powers and truth respectively receive in Suárez’s metaphysics suggests a more complicated story. As Schmid points out, according to Suárez, the powers of a substance ‘naturally result from’ its form, where this natural resulting is an efficient causal process of some kind. Truths, according to Suárez are ‘founded on’ the objects they are about, in the sense that a truth for Suárez just is a cognition and a co-existing object that is as represented by the cognition. Thus, in the first case we have an efficient causal process, while in the second, we seem to have case of partial constitution. Again, in the first case we have the production of a new entity or power in addition to what it results from, while in the second, truth does not amount to an ontological addition to the cognition and object it is founded on. Schmid concludes that

Suárez’s theory of natural resulting and of the foundation of truth makes a powerful case for it being a live possibility that explanatory metaphysical dependences that are naturally expressed by grounding (or ‘in virtue of’) claims should not be construed as a metaphysically uniform phenomenon (304).

Again, the case of Suárez challenges the ‘widespread consensus that grounding is the same in all its typical instances’ (281). Of course, there are ways to defend the consensus view even in view of cases such as that of Suárez. Indeed, one could take the case of Suárez to show not so much that grounding is more heterogeneous a phenomenon than it is taken to be, but rather that what we now think of as fairly uncontroversial cases of grounding or non-causal explanation have not always been, and perhaps need not be, understood in this way. But then, that too would seem to be a welcome point which cases such as Suárez’s case can draw our attention to.

Together, the contributions to this volume show that we can helpfully deploy the terminology of grounding in coming to terms with earlier Aristotelian debates in a wide variety of areas, from the logic of consequence to morality and divine command to the metaphysics of dispositional properties and truth. This will not only advance our understanding of these debates, but will also help historical authors, from Abelard and Avicenna to Suárez, speak to contemporary metaphysicians.

REFERENCES

Jonathan Schaffer, ‘On What Grounds What’, in Metametaphysics. New Essays on the Foundations of Ontology, eds. David Chalmers, David Manley, and Ryan Wasserman, 347–383, Oxford University Press (2009).

Mark Jago, What Truth Is, Oxford University Press (2018).

Gonzalo Rodriguez-Pereyra, ‘Grounding is Not a Strict Order’, Journal of the American Philosophical Association 1 (2015): 517–34.