In 2007, the US company, Purdue Pharma, pleaded guilty to misleading governmental regulators, doctors, and patients about the addictiveness of its opioid product, Oxycodone, known under the brand name OxyContin (Meier 2007, 2018). Purdue Pharma advertised OxyContin as less addictive because it had a slow-release formula. A central issue in the legal battle was whether Purdue Pharma had any evidence for that claim, and what exactly Purdue Pharma knew about the addictiveness of OxyContin when they marketed it to doctors and patients. But Purdue Pharma is not an individual with a curious name; it is, rather, a group composed of many individuals. Consequently, a central issue in this legal battle involved when a group knows something or has evidence for some claim.
Jessica Brown’s new book, Groups as Epistemic and Moral Agents, explores the epistemology and psychology of groups like Purdue Pharma. More specifically, Brown systematically defends a cluster of views about the psychology and epistemology of groups, e.g., when groups have beliefs; when they believe or act for reasons; and when they have evidence, knowledge, or justified belief. A defining feature of the book is its systematicity. Brown doesn’t just provide accounts of various psychological and epistemic properties of groups; she argues that her specific accounts of these properties support and mutually reinforce each other. And she does all of this work in seven brief chapters that barely crack 150 pages.
In Chapter 1, Brown sets the stage for the rest of the book. She assumes that there are groups, and those groups are genuine agents who have mental states and epistemic properties. Even still, one might wonder how it is that groups come to have a certain property. There are two basic approaches Brown considers. On a summativist account of some property P, a group has P if and only if some, most, or all its members have P (2). By contrast, on a non-summativist account, a group might have a property even if none of its members do, or the group might lack a property Q, even if some, most, or all its members have Q (2-3). To illustrate, one property a group might have is believing that p. On a summativist account of that property, a group believes that p if and only if some, most, or all its members believe that p. On a non-summativist account, a group may believe that p even if none of the members of the group believe that p. Following others, Brown formulates the dispute between summativist and non-summativist accounts in terms of necessary and sufficient conditions, as opposed to explanatory or grounding formulations.
Brown’s book is a systematic defense of non-summativism about a range of group properties, including group evidence (Ch. 2), groups believing for a reason (Ch. 3), group belief (Ch. 4), group knowledge (Ch. 5), groups acting for a reason (Ch. 6), and blameless ignorance for a group (Ch. 7). Each chapter is brimming with arguments and interesting ideas that make them hard to succinctly summarize, but there is one overarching idea that is important to highlight.
Brown argues that summativist and non-summativist positions naturally come together as a package. Accordingly, it is problematic to try to “mix-and-match” summativism and non-summativism about different properties (8-16, 82-83, 144-147). Sometimes, Brown’s reasoning goes through “linking principles” that specify necessary and/or sufficient conditions between properties.
To give a simple illustration, suppose one is a non-summativist about group evidence, such that a group might have p as part of its evidence, even though no member of the group has p as part of its evidence. Next, suppose one accepts a “linking principle” on which p is part of an agent’s evidence if and only if the agent knows or has a justified belief that p (9, 21). Those two views will imply a further non-summativist view, namely, that a group may know or have a justified belief that p, even though no member of it knows or has a justified belief that p. Similarly, suppose one is a summativist about group evidence, such that a group has p as part of its evidence if and only if most of its members have p as part of their evidence. Given the same linking principle, a further summativist view will follow, namely, that a group knows or has a justified belief that p if and only if most of its members know or have a justified belief that p.
In Chapter 2, Brown defends a non-summativist account of group evidence, and in Chapter 3, Brown defends a non-summativist account of when a group believes for a reason. Both chapters are noteworthy because Brown defends these non-summativist accounts without relying on non-summativist accounts of other properties. Brown defends each position primarily by criticizing summativist accounts (23-31, 45-53). A central kind of criticism is that summativist accounts struggle to aggregate the properties of their members in ways that provide coherent and intuitive accounts of group evidence and of when groups believe for a reason.
To illustrate one such criticism, suppose that an individual’s evidence consists of their justified beliefs. It is possible that all the members of the group have coherent sets of justified beliefs, but some members of the group have a justified belief that p, whereas other members of the group have a justified belief that ~p. Thus, on some summativist accounts, that group’s evidence will be inconsistent because it will contain both p and ~p, even though no member of the group has an inconsistent set of evidence that contains both p and ~p.
In Chapter 4, Brown defends a non-summativist account of group belief. She develops a functionalist account on which a group believes that p when it realizes the appropriate functional profile for believing p (65-71). Brown contrasts this functional model with an “interpretationist” account, according to which groups are merely interpreted as having beliefs, and a “joint commitment” account, according to which groups believe in virtue of their members jointly committing to believing. She argues that the functionalist account in particular can avoid the battery of objections that Lackey (2021) makes to non-summativist accounts in general.
In Chapter 5, Brown defends non-summativist accounts of group knowledge and justification. More specifically, she is interested in an account of non-inferential group knowledge and justification. Brown argues that a reliabilist testimonial model is superior to both an inferential model and a perceptual model. On an inferential model, a group belief that p is non-inferentially justified only if it is inferred from the beliefs of the members, and the members’ beliefs are justified. Brown criticizes this model as ill-conceived since the group belief is not inferred from other beliefs of the group (88).
On the perceptual model, a group belief that p is non-inferentially justified if the members of the group use an aggregation method that is reliable, and the group lacks any defeaters for believing p. Brown criticizes this model as insufficient, since it may be an accident that the group used an aggregation method that is reliable (89-90). By contrast, on Brown’s reliabilist testimonial model, a group has a justified belief (or knowledge) that p because the members of the group are reliable testifiers that p, and the group is a reliable recipient of that testimony (97-99). She thinks the testimonial model is better than the inferential model, since testimony may generate non-inferential knowledge and justification from others' beliefs. She thinks the reliabilist testimonial model is better than the perceptual model, since the group must be a reliable recipient of the testimony and thus sensitive to whether the process generating potential beliefs is reliable.
In Chapters 6 and 7, Brown turns to questions about group action. In Chapter 6, she provides a non-summativist account of what it is for a group to act for a reason (127ff.). She claims, plausibly, that there should be a unified account for what it is to believe and act for reasons (111). Unsurprisingly, the discussion of this chapter is similar to Chapter 3’s discussion of when a group believes for a reason. In Chapter 7, Brown provides a non-summativist account of when a group acts from blameless ignorance. She argues that blameless ignorance cannot be assimilated to other categories, such as lacking knowledge or having a justified false belief (137-141). She also develops an account on which a group’s ignorance is blameless if it is not reasonable to expect the group to not be ignorant (148, 150).
Brown’s book is an excellent paradigm of analytic epistemology. The writing is crisp, clear, and easy to follow. There are well-defined positions, terms, and principles. The chapters are well-organized. Each chapter is brimming with arguments and ideas. Most scholars will have no difficulty engaging the book, and it could be assigned to undergraduates without much fear.
Additionally, Brown’s cluster of non-summativist views make for an attractive and compelling combination. Her accounts can accommodate a lot of intuitive data about the psychology and epistemology of groups. Like all philosophical accounts, there are objections to be raised, and I’m sure many will focus on critical comparisons between Brown’s accounts and rival ones found in Lackey (2021). But Brown’s arguments and accounts are serious ones worthy of engagement.
One major criticism of the book is that it is too short. Many of the ideas—both positive proposals and critical objections—are underdeveloped. There are places where more could have been said to provide a robust defense of the views defended. Here are two examples. In Chapter 4, Brown defends functionalism about group belief. But she spends little to no space explaining how exactly the members of a group might come to realize the functional roles of beliefs, as well as the functional roles of other mental states, e.g., desires or intentions. Further, given that Brown’s functionalism is a non-summativist view, the group may realize a belief that p, while none of its members believe that p. It would have been good to hear how this is possible.
Similarly, in Chapter 6, Brown defends a testimonial model of group belief on which members of the group are producers of testimony, and the group is the consumer (97). But testimony normally involves an act of testifying. And it is unclear how exactly members of a group testify to the group itself. None of this is to say that there are obvious problems with Brown’s proposed accounts. It is just to say that more could have been said to provide richer and fuller accounts of the phenomenon.
There are some smaller criticisms to be made of the book. First, in keeping with analytic epistemology, Brown uses a number of abstract, highly stylized examples and counterexamples. However, my intuitions do not always line up with Brown’s. It might have been useful to have concrete, contemporary or historical cases to more firmly ground readers’ intuitions. Second, given the title of the book, readers might have expected an extended discussion of groups as moral agents. For instance, one might assume there would be discussions of what obligations groups have; the relations between group obligations and the obligations of members of groups; whether groups have virtues and vices; etc. But for the most part, these topics are not given extended treatment.
Lastly, there is a missed opportunity in not having a formal appendix. Brown formulates summativism and non-summativism, as well as some linking principles between properties, in terms of necessary and/or sufficient conditions. As a result, it is possible to provide elementary proofs of certain combinations of summativism or non-summativism as consistent or inconsistent. A formal appendix could have neatly shown the deductive relations between the views defended and discussed. Brown does discuss the formal relations between views, but it is oftentimes spread out. A unified appendix would have been useful.
Nonetheless, Brown’s book is easy to recommend to authors working in, or interested in, the epistemology of groups. It is full of interesting arguments, and Brown defends a plausible cluster of accounts. It will surely become a standard defense of non-summativist accounts.
ACKNOWLEDGEMENTS
Thanks to Jessica Brown for feedback on this review.
REFERENCES
Lackey, Jennifer. 2021. The Epistemology of Groups. Oxford University Press.
Meier, Barry. 2007. “In Guilty Plea, OxyContin Maker to Pay $600 Million.” The New York Times. URL: https://www.nytimes.com/2007/05/10/business/11drug-web.html
Meier, Barry. 2018. “Origins of an Epidemic: Purdue Pharma Knew Its Opioids Were Widely Abused.” New York Times. URL: https://www.nytimes.com/2018/05/29/health/purdue-opioids-oxycontin.html