Paul Ricoeur famously singled out Marx, Nietzsche, and Freud as three “masters of suspicion”, bent on looking beneath the surface of modern Western reason (1970: 32). Despite their many differences, all three denounced Enlightenment rationalism as an artificial construction, rooted in a covert set of economic or psychological motivations, and their criticisms have cast a long historical shadow. In Hegel’s World Revolutions, Richard Bourke aims to challenge this critical trend. He focuses, more precisely, on how the cultural pessimism that emerged during the late nineteenth century has shaped contemporary thought and on the favour it currently enjoys in academic and intellectual circles. In his eyes, “what started out as an eccentric tradition of historical reflection”, launched by Nietzsche and generalized by Heidegger, Adorno and Foucault, “now occupies a central place on university courses”. With the advance of modern and postmodern critical theory, “whole generations have been coaxed into a posture of suspicion” (ix) and led to mistrust the rational conquests of the modern world.
It is questionable whether this attitude is as influential as Bourke suggests, given the current academic dominance of Anglo-American liberal theory. Still, it is certainly true that the Enlightenment’s universalist values are now dismissed, in some quarters, as thoroughly biased, coercive or Eurocentric, and that the notion of historical progress is rejected by many as hopelessly ideological. Opposing this general trend, Bourke seeks to reaffirm the West’s rationalist legacy. And he does so by turning to Hegel’s philosophy of history and its unique emphasis on modernity’s emancipatory potential. Hegel, of course, is no wide-eyed optimist, but a sophisticated critic of the Enlightenment. Instead of negating its achievements, however, he highlights their unilateral nature and locates them within the wider positive process whereby reason attains reality. On his view, the ideals of freedom and equality characteristic of Western modernity are irreducible to their flawed historical actualization. Although the modern world “is still replete with glaring cases of injustice. . .its history records a process of liberation” (ix–x) that must not be downplayed or relativized.
This approach is not without precedent. A similar emphasis on the human capacity for self-improvement is already found in Kant, who also proposes a philosophical reconstruction of history aimed at bringing out the “regular course of improvement” leading from the ancient Greek polis to the modern constitutional state (1996: 119). Moreover, Kant also measures the rationality of a given society by the extent to which it promotes human freedom. However, his philosophy of history is still informed by a moral understanding of political progress: he conceives of political agents as constitutively torn between selflessness and self-interest, and views every civilizational breakthrough as a victory of the former over the latter. For Hegel, political change is not confined to this dual framework. It hinges on a complex historical interplay between human intentions and the actual norms and institutions in which they are grounded. While Kant remains focused on the fulfilment of a timeless rational ideal, Hegel treats reason as an inherently dynamic goal, whose nature can only be fully grasped in the process of its actualization.
Hegel’s account of world history is structured around a series of epochal shifts: the transition from the pre-classical world to Greek civilization, from its decline to the rise of the Roman empire, and from the latter’s decline to the advent of the modern “Germanic” realm. Bourke condenses this long historical movement into two main transformative axes, discussed in the book’s first and second parts. He starts by charting humankind’s moral evolution, which for Hegel begins with the dawn of the Christian world. While Judaism emphasized human impotence in the face of an all-mighty God, Christianity insisted on the moral freedom to distinguish right from wrong. Yet this new doctrine was at odds with mundane existence, prompting the faithful to either flee into a spiritual “void” or enmesh themselves in worldly politics. Later, this division would lead to Luther’s Reformation, and later still to the Kantian distinction between duty and inclination. Rejecting these dualisms, Hegel called for a reconciliation of the autonomous and the heteronomous dimensions of morality. Bourke reconstructs his search for this reconciliation during the 1790s with admirable skill. His discussion of Hegel’s early writings, notorious for their thematic dispersion, is clear and sophisticated.
The book’s second part is also about this attempt at reconciliation, but applied more directly to the political realm. Extending the scope of his analysis to Hegel’s mature writings, Bourke retraces his views on the evolution of political freedom in medieval and modern Europe. Central to this account is Hegel’s complex assessment of the French Revolution. Although he saw the upheaval in France as a watershed moment, he did not treat it as an isolated event, but as part of a wider historical trend, fueled by the decline of feudal nobility and culminating in Jacobinism and its demise. Hegel’s criticisms of the revolutionary process are emphasized in order to challenge his reputation as a champion of the French Revolution. The topic is still controversial among Hegel scholars, and a classical bone of contention between more conservative and more progressive readings of his work, but Bourke convincingly shows that Hegel associated the revolution with yet another “flight from ‘actuality’” (169), at odds with its concrete ethical context.
Finally, the book’s third part deals with the modern reception of Hegel’s ideas. After a steady decline in the second half of the 19th century, his work was rehabilitated in Germany by Wilhem Dilthey, Friedrich Meinecke, and Franz Rosenzweig, and later also abroad by Georg Lukács, Jean Wahl, and Alexandre Kojève. However, the horrors of two world wars led many to reject Hegel’s belief in historical progress. Cultural advances were regarded as mere “fragments of a larger pattern of deterioration” (250) which denied history any redeeming value. On the one hand, critics like Heidegger, Horkheimer or Adorno grounded their pessimistic accounts of modernity in a global indictment of “occidental patterns of thought” (226); on the other, Strauss and Arendt sought to overcome modernity’s failures by resuscitating ancient conceptions of politics and society. From a Hegelian perspective, both strategies are misguided: past worldviews are not to be simply endorsed or rejected, but recognized as different stages in the historical actualization of reason.
Hegel’s World Revolutions successfully combines solid philosophical argumentation with careful historical analysis. Retracing Hegel’s intellectual path from his early writings to his late Berlin lectures, the book offers illuminating insights into the formation of his political thought. Unfortunately, this chronological approach leaves little room for a systematic discussion of thornier hermeneutical issues, such as the exact relationship between philosophy and historical reality. Bourke is somewhat ambiguous in this regard: while he concedes that philosophy can be “a determinant of historical change”, if only in certain periods and to a variable degree (151), he sometimes appears to reduce the philosopher to a sophisticated chronicler of bygone eras. Hegel, he claims, “denied that thinkers could offer practical direction” (215), settling instead for a critical rearticulation of the past. Yet what one finds in many key texts is arguably a more complex dialectical picture, in which philosophy is both a reconstruction of the past and, at the same time, a theoretical anticipation of a new historical era. Born out of the “breakdown” of a given cultural paradigm, philosophy is “the inner birthplace of the spirit that emerges later as actuality” (Hegel 2009: 67).
A second topic left unexplored is the actual merit of Hegel’s theory of the state. And here two further issues are worth mentioning. First, his resistance to popular democracy is justified by a commitment to avoiding political changes “bound to prove counterproductive under conditions as they existed” (119). For Axel Honneth, likewise, Hegel was against making “unrealistic demands on social behaviour” (2014: 8). However, a defence of his position along these lines implies a previous determination of what a given age is and is not ready to accept. And Hegel himself recognizes that support for popular sovereignty had become common by the early nineteenth century (2008: §301R), and was therefore already within the horizon of his age. Second, Bourke insists that we are not Hegel’s contemporaries, thereby suggesting not only that his political views cannot be directly revived, but also that we should refrain from passing judgement on them. And the latter principle is strictly observed throughout Hegel’s World Revolutions, where even his most contentious positions are sympathetically presented. Yet Hegel was also criticized for being inconsistent with his own philosophical principles. A case in point is the obvious tension between his affirmation of freedom and self-determination and his approval of hereditary monarchy, limited political participation, and aristocratic birth rights. In my view, to highlight these inconsistencies is not to betray the “spirit” of his philosophy, but to clarify the extent to which it remains relevant.
The previous comments touch only on a small part of Bourke’s wide-ranging book. More than a mere monograph on Hegel’s political thought, his work is an ambitious and fascinating study on the ways in which philosophy can relate to its own history, and on the lessons it can learn from past thinkers, ideas, and traditions. At a time when the notion of progress is increasingly hard to reconcile with historical reality, such an exercise is particularly welcome.
REFERENCES
Hegel, Georg Wilhelm Friedrich. 2009. Lectures on the History of Philosophy: The Lectures of 1825–26. Volume I: Introduction and Oriental Philosophy, trans. and ed. Robert F. Brown and J. M. Stewart, ed. Robert F. Brown. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Hegel, Georg Wilhelm Friedrich. 2008. Outlines of the Philosophy of Right, trans. T. M. Knox, ed. Stephen Houlgate. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Honneth, Axel. 2014. Freedom’s Right: The Social Foundations of Democratic Life, trans. Joseph Ganahl. Cambridge: Polity Press.
Kant, Immanuel. 1996. Anthropology, History, and Education, trans. Mary Gregor et al., ed. Günter Zöller and Robert B. Louden. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Ricoeur, Paul. 1970. Freud and Philosophy: An Essay on Interpretation, trans. David Savage. New Haven, CT: Yale University Press.