In How Plato Writes, Malcolm Schofield collects fourteen “occasional offerings” on Plato published between 1997 and 2021. Binding together these works is a serious perceptiveness about the dialogues, a capacity to capture their most substantive but often not particularly evident argumentative moves. Speaking personally, I have found them to show Plato studies—sometimes a hermetic and self-satisfied field—in the best possible light, as instances of an acute and curious philosophical mind investigating the most interesting elements of an endlessly subtle, exploratory, and profound author.
The title echoes Danielle Allen’s Why Plato Wrote (2010) and, further back, Paul Shorey’s What Plato Said (1933). It resembles neither. Shorey’s grand opening line sets out his project: “The text of this book is a résumé of the entire body of the Platonic writings”. He endeavors to establish the unity of what Plato said—that is, his outlook—across all the dialogues, in 450 dense pages. Allen’s book argues that
Plato wrote, among other purposes, to effect political change…the world’s first systematic political philosopher, using text to record technical philosophical advances…he was also, it appears, the western world’s first think-tank activist and its first message man. (4)
She identifies putatively Platonic vocabulary and ideas across mid-fourth century political oratory.
Schofield’s book lacks the expository or explanatory goals of these iconic predecessors. Its title suggests a descriptive goal instead, a focus on the literary-philosophical composition of the dialogues, where “composition” has either a biographical-causal aspect (what Plato has done to prepare to write them as he has) or a structural-analytic aspect (what Plato has done with the dialogues to affect the reader as he has). But the title, notwithstanding the neutral subtitle, misleads.
Most of the chapters of the book solve discrete and relatively well-known scholarly intra-dialogical problems. They do so by revisiting them with a more sensitive and capacious reading of the surrounding span of text. They do not do so by means of some unusual methodology, whereby the horizon of relevant evidence gets expanded by some degree; rather, Schofield provides an engagement with the text that simply brings more parts of it, especially at the micro (though usually not text-critical) level, into productive focus. Such are those “problems” and “perspectives” in the subtitle. Indeed, what methodology Schofield displays might count as mainstream philosophical “dialogue autonomy” interpretation, where the relevant evidence is the sequence of claims found in the work by itself. He has little tendency toward historicist contextualism (excepting the first chapter), philological genre determinism, or corpus intertextualization. The “Introduction” (1–11), for its part, mostly summarizes the ensuing chapters.
Before turning to some of those problems and perspectives, I shall say a word about the expected readership of this book. The book lacks the usual sorts of unity: a single argument, the exercise of a single interpretative mode, a compassing of the entirety or a cogent subset of an author’s work, a series of case studies on a single theme. It also lacks the reviewer’s crutch, novelty, such that a reader can see it as the state of the art, or what must now be argued against. So what is to be done with such a book? For what reason would one pick it up? There are actually two reasons, one for getting it from the library, another for buying it for oneself. It provides easy access to excellent studies on old chestnuts: problems in Gorgias (Callicles), Parmenides (Third Man), Cratylus (the Heraclitean Cratylus), Republic (Noble Lie and Cave), and Laws (a range of topics). Anyone teaching or writing about these issues would save time, and get nice insight, by borrowing the volume and going right to the relevant chapter. But owning and reading through the whole book has the salutary effect of re-enchanting the study of Plato.[1] The first three chapters differ from the following eleven in not actually dealing with discrete problems of dialogue interpretation. But they also best reflect the book’s title, and so I have chosen to give them the most attention.
The Three Chapters of Part I
“Plato in His Place and Time” (15–41), credited to the revised Oxford Handbook of Plato (2019), biographizes argumentatively. Considering it in light of three recent biographies of Plato, by Robin Waterfield (2023), Carol Atack (2025), and James Romm (2025), it shows how much scholarly opinion about Plato the philosopher depends on scholarly opinion about Plato the late fourth-century Athenian. In illustration, I give a sampling of Schofield’s contentions here.
Plato’s dialogues are through and through Socratic: “Nearly the entire output of the most powerful and fertile thinker in the entire tradition of Western philosophy is conceived as a homage to Socrates and in re-creation of his philosophizing” (15). They depict a thought-world saturated with the idea of expertise or skills, “technai”, where “the value in any valuable activity must derive from its being practiced knowledgeably” (17). And the moral harms that Socrates warns of come much more through “the whims of the Athenian people” than from “the Sophists”; accordingly, “the giants of the Sophistic era” (quoting Guthrie 1975, 4), such as Protagoras and Gorgias, do not represent Plato’s primary worry (19–20).
Accordingly, says Schofield, Plato’s “loath[ing] and despis[ing]” of democracy was actually ambivalent—for, despite the “incoherent malice” the Athenian people expressed toward Socrates, democracy also explains the “high spirits, variety, and intellectual freedom of Athenian aristocratic life” (20–3). The ambivalence is clear enough, but I’m uneasy with this familiar psychologizing approach, both for ascribing strident emotions to an author and for the presumed determinacy of the target, “democracy”.
Hardly an advocate of developmentalism—the thesis that Plato’s epistemic or metaphysical commitments shifted in reconstructable ways as his career progressed—Schofield remains impressed by changes in Plato’s philosophical interests and in the tenor of his writing and believes that the composition order of the dialogues is either revealed by or helps reveal these changes. He believes that Plato’s travels west to Magna Graeca starting around age 40 deeply informed his intellectual trajectory (23–27). Now, all the lore about Plato’s supposed trips to Italy, and especially about his training of the Sicilian tyrant Dionysius, presented in the Platonic Epistles, deserve robust skepticism.
Schofield, silently, maintains a responsible diffidence at least about the Syracusan adventures. But he does allow himself to speculate about the effects of visits elsewhere in southern Italy. First, that in visiting Archytas and fellow Pythagoreans, Plato “converted to Pythagoreanism”. Second, he got exposed to “an exotic non-Athenian religious…environment”. Schofield sees both as explaining Plato’s turn, in certain supposedly non-early dialogues, toward mathematics and eschatology; they also point toward “the founding of the Academy”. In litigating this argument, Schofield might underplay how “Socratic” the Gorgias (a target dialogue) still is, and he might exaggerate the power of travel by contrast to local or literary influences. But as Gilbert Ryle’s Plato’s Progress (1966) showed, biographical speculation has its place in thinking afresh about an important early author.
I will simply mention a few other claims Schofield makes. The Gorgias evidences a burgeoning concern with tyranny (28). The Gorgias and Euthydemus evidence an ongoing dispute with Isocrates (29–32). Aristotle may be right in emphasizing the influence of Cratylus and Heraclitus on Plato’s intellectual formation (32–6; this point gets developed in Chapter 6). Academic discussion inspired the content of various dialogues (36–8). The Laws reflects biographical elements in Plato’s sixties (38–41). There’s lots to think about here.
The brief second chapter, “When and Why Did Plato Write Narrated Dialogues?” (42–51), tries to explain a pattern whereby certain supposedly early and late dialogues are “dramatic”—like a narrator-less script—but dialogues written between these two periods are “narrated” with a single main voice. Those narrated by Socrates allow complex interplay between report and obiter dicta. Those narrated by marvelous chain-links of other speakers (such as the Symposium and Parmenides) end up emphasizing the fictionality of the conversation and thereby emphasize the Platonicity, i.e., non-Socraticity, of the ideas developed therein. Schofield admits that this idea is pretty schematic and uncertain. He should have mentioned the idea that Plato would also be mimicking a practice typical of Socratic sunousia: remembering and retelling and reflecting on important conversations. He should probably also have referred to parallel practices of embedded conversation-reporting common to fifth- and fourth-century literature, as one might find in Herodotus, tragic messenger speeches, or even within speeches in the dialogues themselves.
The third chapter, “Against System: The Historical Plato in the Mid-Victorian Era” (52–70), provides an account of large-scale, important, and culturally salient debates about Plato’s oeuvre and outlook, focusing on George Grote, J. S. Mill, and Benjamin Jowett. Nineteenth-century disputes about Plato’s overall project, and whether he even had one, come to seem of rather greater significance than the smikrologikoi debates today between advocates of developmentalism and unitarianism, between mouthpiece theory and Socratism, between doctrine and discovery. Plato interpretation is conditioned by the dialectic of its time.
The Other Chapters
Chapter 4, “Callicles’ Return: Gorgias 509–22 Reconsidered” (73–95), gives an edifying argument reconstruction and a revelation of Plato’s cleverness, even inventiveness, in dialectical maneuvering. It articulates Callicles’ commitment to an “assimilation” thesis, that survival in a tyrannical city requires being like that tyrant. This becomes an acute problem for this aspirant to survival when, unexpectedly, the dêmos, “people at large”, prove the tyrant, and his wellbeing depends on their whim. The chapter also pleads for a better diagnosis of the unsettled ending of the conversation between Socrates and Callicles: not “failure” per se of the “Socratic method” but clarity about Callicles’ being too far bought into a different value set for Socrates, or anybody, to bring him back around. (It is arresting to be reminded, p. 75, that Gorgias is Plato’s third longest dialogue, especially if length reflects programmatic seriousness.)
Chapter 5, “Likeness and Likenesses in the Parmenides” (96–117), discusses the second of the dialogue’s two regress arguments against forms, a version of the “Third Man Argument”. Schofield connects it up to the anti-pluralist argument about “likeness” ascribed to Zeno in the opening pages of the dialogue, and he shows that Plato suggests that “likeness” is a second-order predicate (the state of sharing first-order predicates) rather than a first-order predicate (participating in the form Likeness). Schofield draws a stirring conclusion: Platonic “forms” do not need to be of a single type; his metaphysics need not be “monolithic in its logical structure”.
Then Chapter 6, “The Elusiveness of Cratylus in the Cratylus” (118–35), really satisfies. It posits two characterizations of Cratylus at either end of the dialogue—a crypto-Heraclitean at first but then a crypto-Antisthenean later on. According to Schofield, Plato makes Cratylus a proxy for a “secret doctrine” (132, drawing an analogy to Protagoras’ “secret doctrine” in the Theaetetus): the integrated but problematic doctrine of “no saying what is false” (a semantic view), “knowledge of reality comes through names” (an epistemic view), and “flux” (an ontological view).
Brevity requires that I only applaud the pedagogical value of the two chapters on the Republic. The first argues for the centrality, even reasonableness, of the Noble Lie. The second describes the tension between the two facets of the Cave allegory: its immediate presentation as an allegory for anybody’s education, and Socrates’ retrospective analysis of it as an allegory for the mathematical training of the philosopher-leaders. I would only note, about the latter, the astonishing fact that advanced mathematics holds such an important role in the Republic, despite having been a technical research field for only around half a century. Plato’s enthusiasm for and commitment to this young science—taking up or at least replicating the outlook of Hippias of Elis several decades earlier—is quite striking.
The final six chapters, across one hundred pages, address the Laws. The first of these (Chapter 9) directs its attention to the dialogue as a whole, asking after its audience and goal, and noticing places that call for more philosophical argument than Plato provides. The second of them (Chapter 10) has a similar scope, adumbrating the tension between the dialogue’s ideal and non-ideal projects. The last four take up more specific issues.
The Title
Malcolm Schofield is a tremendous teacher of Plato; I learned so much more about his dialogues than I have pointed to here. Now, I’m not sure how much I learned about “how Plato writes”, and I feel some regret that Cambridge University Press used up this title for this book. (I remain keen for a comprehensive study of Plato as prose writer—indeed, as the greatest author of ancient Greek prose.) Nevertheless, one part of the way Plato writes is to unspool incisive, unusual, and unexpected arguments across his characters’ conversations. The intellectual creativity with which he dramatizes Socrates’ performances of talk—as well as that of the Athenian visitor, protagonist of the Law—and saturates them with complex and ultimately plausible ideas, obviously gives them much of their appeal and zing. This is the part Schofield does discuss, selectively, and for that we can be most appreciative.
REFERENCES
Allen, Danielle S. Why Plato Wrote. Wiley-Blackwell, 2010.
Atack, Carol. Plato: a civic life. Reaktion Books, 2025.
Fine, Gail, editor. The Oxford Handbook of Plato. Oxford University Press, 2019.
Guthrie, W. K. C., A History of Greek Philosophy: Volume 4, Plato: The Man and his Dialogues: Earlier Period. Cambridge University Press, 1975.
Romm, James. Plato and the Tyrant: The Fall of Greece’s Greatest Dynasty and the Making of a Philosophic Masterpiece. W.W. Norton & Company, 2025.
Ryle, Gilbert. Plato’s Progress. Cambridge University Press, 1966.
Shorey, Paul. What Plato Said. University of Chicago Press, 1933.
Waterfield. Plato of Athens: a life in philosophy. Oxford University Press, 2023.
[1] I would note that Schofield’s editorial introductions to Tom Griffith’s Plato translations do this as well, in a more pedagogical mode. See Moore, Christopher. Review of Plato: Gorgias, Menexenus, and Protagoras. Cambridge Texts in the History of Political Thought by Malcolm Schofield (introduction) and Tom Griffith (transl.), Bryn Mawr Classical Review, 2010.11.12.