Hume's Imagination

Tito Magri’s Hume’s Imagination is a big and impressive book. Big: with almost 500 pages of text, it is longer than ATreatise of Human Nature, David Hume’s masterwork, the first Book of which Magri takes as his focus. Magri thoughtfully helps his readers follow the argument of his book’s 12 chapters (divided into five parts) by providing both succinct summaries at the end of each chapter and an appendix that lists the various interpretive principles he excavates in his comprehensive readings.

Impressive: Hume appeals to the imagination repeatedly throughout (especially) Book 1 of the Treatise;^[1] its core role is to reproduce content that has previously been sensed or felt so that it can be used in creative or rational thought. But he also appeals to the imagination to introduce flexibility into his empiricism, to explain the possibility of conceptual thinking, to account for our mathematical practices, to enable causal reasoning, to produce our beliefs about bodies and minds, to allow us to escape from sceptical aporiai, and much more. Magri provides insight into all of these topics in what is one of only a few book-length treatments of this fulcrum of Hume’s philosophy.^[2]

Part I of Magri’s book is devoted to what Hume calls the “elements” of his philosophy (T 1.1.4.7), in particular, Hume’s fundamental empiricist principle that all ideas (thoughts) are ultimately copied from prior simple impressions (sensations or feelings)—or rather, almost all ideas. The notorious, missing shade of blue (a thought experiment in which Hume suggests that someone who has experienced all shades of blue but one would be able to think of—have an idea of—the missing shade without having had a prior impression; T 1.1.1.10) serves as the first hint of what Magri sees as Hume’s core strategy: revealing that the “gaps” left by our sensibilities are filled in not by an intellect that somehow transcends our animal nature but rather by the imagination.

In Part II, Magri turns both to Hume’s treatment of general ideas, where again the imagination enables us to think of universals, despite our senses yielding only particularistic content; and to his conceivability principle—where the imagination’s capacities determine the limits of the possible. Part III addresses Hume’s famous investigation of causation, where he argues that we do not have rational insight into the intrinsic necessary connections between objects; instead, the imagination’s development of habits of association yields an impression of necessity that enables a suitably constrained form of causal reasoning.

In Part IV, Magri focuses on perhaps the thorniest portions of Hume’s treatment of the understanding: his discussions of the external world—including the extent to which mathematics accurately captures its properties—and the internal world—including Hume’s discussion of personal identity and his enigmatic rejection of it in the “Appendix,” published almost two years after Book 1 of the Treatise. Magri suggests that Hume ultimately recognizes that he needs an account of subjectivity, of “essentially first-personal self-presence” (380). Finally, Part V considers the epistemological issues that emerge from Hume’s repeated appeal to arational features of the imagination to explain our cognitive lives.

Magri’s Hume ends up as what he calls a “representational naturalist” (72) and an “inferentialist”, not in the terms made famous by Robert Brandom, where inferences belong to a “space of reasons,” but rather with inferences understood in terms of gap-filling associative transitions in imagination. This is an attractive and plausible reading of Hume and shows why his work remains relevant today.

That said, I (inevitably) also took issue with some of Magri’s interpretive choices. Hume is notorious for arguments that appear clear in their narrow context but that contradict or are in tension with other portions of the text. As Magri puts, he sometimes offers “a deceitfully plain and perspicuous sequence of claims and arguments” (43). His readers are thus forced to decide which passages to emphasize and which to explain away. This is particularly true when it comes to the fundamental item in Hume’s ontology of mind: perceptions. Famously, the mind is nothing but a “bundle or collection of different perceptions, which succeed each other with an inconceivable rapidity, and are in a perpetual flux and movement” (T 1.4.6.4). But, as Henry Allison and other have emphasized, Hume sometimes displays a “lamentable inattention to (or perhaps exploitation of) the perceived-perceiving ambiguity” (2008, 243).

Magri addresses this problem not by arguing for one of these options as Hume’s primary sense for ‘perception’, but rather by taking him to explicitly embrace both, a principle he labels “Two Viewpoints”. Perceptions can, he says, be “considered” either as “mental activities”, i.e., perceivings, or in terms of their content, i.e., perceiveds.

There is something right in this, but I have trouble seeing them as two viewpoints, as opposed to two aspects. When a person sees, say, a red apple, a perceiving-as-of-the-red-apple occurs in their mind-bundle. As a seeing, it is a mental activity; but it is also as-of-the-red-apple (though, as Magri emphasizes, Hume has much to say about how the imagination’s combining of simple impressions allows for this kind of rich content). The person does not have a viewpoint on their seeing; they rather have a viewpoint on the apple. The Humean anatomist of mind, however, can introspectively view the perception and can attend to either of its two aspects; but because they are inseparable, this kind of attention would require a “distinction of reason”, another process that Hume takes to be mediated by the imagination (37).

Magri, however, then goes on to pair Two Viewpoints with a principle he calls “Equivalence”, namely, that “impressions of sensation and objects of sense have the same properties of content” (471), though elsewhere he makes the stronger claim that “Impressions of sense, considered in their contents, are in fact the same as sensible objects” (46). I think Magri takes these claims to be licensed by Hume’s notoriously baroque discussion of the processes of the imagination that enable us to treat the repetition of qualitatively similar sense impressions as a case of re-encountering an enduring object (T 1.4.2.24-43). At one point, Hume considers the Berkeleyan challenge of how (the content of) a perception can exist without being perceived, and he appeals to the possibility of a perception’s being separated from the mind-bundle as a response. We can conceive the perception apart from the bundle and thus their separation is possible (T 1.4.2.39-40). Magri concludes that the “identity of perceptions … across their being perceived or unperceived is non-negotiable in Hume’s philosophy” (34). I would rather say that this odd locution of ‘perceiving perceptions’ (recall that Hume denies that there is a subject that stands over or superintends—perceives—the perceptions that constitute a mind) suggests that negotiation is exactly what is required in making sense of Hume’s point here.

For what does he mean when he talks of separating perceptions from the mind-bundle? Given Magri’s Two Viewpoints, the separated perception must still be a mental activity—a perceiving—that has distinctive content—a perceived. In the “Appendix” to the Treatise, Hume points out that such an isolated perception would amount to a mind, perhaps of a creature “reduc’d even below the life of an oyster”, feeling only “thirst or hunger” (T App.16). The separated perception, then, is not, pace Magri, a helpful way for understanding ordinary object awareness. This is so even if its content—when in a context suitable for the imagination’s processing (alongside other impressions that are qualitatively similar to or coherent with it, T 1.4.2.18-19)—does contribute to our conception of an object, namely, as the same in kind as what we perceive but different in “relations, connections and durations” (T 1.2.6.9). Visually, we sense the top side of the table by means of our awareness of a mental image that persists only for as long as we do not close our eyes or move our heads. But the imagination leads us to believe we are encountering a three-dimensional table with an underside and four legs that has persisted for some time and that will be there when we return, unless someone removes it from the room or disassembles it or the like.

Hume makes things difficult for his interpreters by saying, for example, that “what any common man means by a hat, or shoe, or stone” counts among the “impression[s], convey’d to him by his senses” (T 1.4.2.31), as if the ordinary objects around us are perceptions. But he also notes that he is at that point in the text temporarily using ‘perception’ non-standardly, as synonymous with ‘object’, supposedly for ease of exposition (T 1.4.2.31-46). It would be very odd indeed if Hume, who claims to focus only on the “anatomy of the mind” (T 2.1.12.2), were to identify the world with mental entities. Magri’s claim, then, that “The very same things can exist within the mind and without the mind” (32) strikes me as misleading. The table cannot exist within the mind. The seeing of the table, while not intrinsically connected with the other perceptions constituting the mind of the one seeing, would be the mind of a sub-oyster were it detached from the other perceptions in the relevant mind-bundle.

I have been focusing on Magri’s treatment of Hume’s theory of perceptions, especially as it relates to our sensory access to a persisting world of everyday objects, e.g., hats, shoes, stones. These are the topics on which Hume is especially obscure.^[3] I do not mean my criticisms to detract from my deep admiration for Magri’s accomplishments. He has given us a comprehensive, historically informed reading of Book 1 of the Treatise and a thorough and fair engagement with the secondary literature that includes works of contemporary philosophy of mind. Hume’s Imagination is a landmark in Hume studies and in scholarship on early modern philosophy, more generally.

REFERENCES

Ainslie, Donald. Hume’s True Scepticism. Oxford University Press, 2015.

Allison, Henry. Custom and Reason in Hume: A Kantian Reading of the First Book of the Treatise. Oxford University Press, 2008.

Brandom, Robert. Making it Explicit: Reasoning, Representing, and Discursive Commitment. Harvard University Press, 1994.

Costelloe, Timothy. The Imagination in Hume’s Philosophy. Edinburgh University Press, 2018.

Hume, David. A Treatise on Human Nature: A Critical Edition. Vol 1. Edited by David F. Norton and Mary J. Norton. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 2007.

Wilbanks, Jan. Hume’s Theory of Imagination. The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1968.