What is involved when someone, such as a scientist, uses a model to represent the world? According to Mauricio Suárez, we can examine this question in one of two ways: in terms of an analytic inquiry that answers a ‘constitutional’ question, or in terms of a practical inquiry that answers a ‘means’ question (84–89).
Traditionally, representation is understood constitutionally, “identifying [representation] entirely with the set of facts about the properties of the relata” (7). Here, the relata are the source of representation, “the object doing the representational work”, and the target of representation, “the object getting represented” (6). The traditional approach, which Suárez labels ‘reductive naturalism’, provides a metaphysical analysis of the representational relation, one that “[avoids] any reference to human values [and] . . . the interests, desires, and purposes of the inquirers” (7).
Suárez’s recommended approach is to examine representation in terms of its means, “focusing instead on the very diverse range of models and modeling techniques employed in the sciences”, while paying close attention to “the purposes of those who use and develop the representations” (86). This change of focus reflects, on Suárez’s view, a disciplinary shift in the philosophy of science where analytic inquiries are replaced with “an attempt to understand modeling practices”, a shift indicated by “the intense intention that philosophers have paid to scientific models and modeling practice in the last decades” (85).
Where does this refocusing on matters of scientific practice, and away from questions of metaphysical analysis, lead us? Suárez starts in Chapter 2 by examining the reflections on scientific practice of a unique set of 19th century physicists, Herman von Helmholtz, Heinrich Hertz, James Clerk Maxwell, and Ludwig Boltzmann, and identifies in these reflections an expression of what Suárez calls the ‘modeling attitude’, “a rather loose set of normative commitments . . . that bounds and informs [this] practice within recognized parameters” (44). He continues in Chapter 3 by reviewing a further unique set of contemporary modeling practices rooted in 19th century science, “the engineering model of the 1890 Forth Rail Bridge, the billiard ball model of gases, and stellar structure models in astrophysics” (79). For those familiar with Suárez’s previous work, chapters 2 and 3 constitute new material (xi).
In comparison, chapters 4 to 7 are reworkings of previously published material, developing and arguing for the details of Suárez’s inferential, deflationist theory of model representation, now ‘inspired’ by the 19th century modeling attitude and employing the three case studies as ‘benchmarks’ (84). Chapter 8 presents novel material in support of a deflationist conception. The classic source of philosophical discussion of representation occurs in the philosophy of art and Suárez finds that his representational deflationism “exhibits a notable fit” (223) with Richard Wollheim’s view of the experience of ‘seeing-in’. Chapter 9 concludes the book with original assessments of familiar debates in the philosophy of science. Concerning the realism/anti-realism debate, deflationism resuscitates the tenability of Ian Hacking’s entity realism, Bas van Fraassen’s constructive empiricism, and Arthur Fine’s natural ontological attitude. Further, the turn to emphasizing the role of social practice, characteristic of Suárez’s deflationism, enhances both Philip Kitcher’s ‘real realism’ and Helen Longino’s social epistemology. Finally, the absence of a facticity requirement on successful modeling, as Suárez sees it, provides support for Henk de Regt’s account of scientific understanding.
Suárez’s book rewards the attentive reader with its thorough detail, meticulous argumentation, and scholarly richness. Whether it provides a defensible view of scientific representation turns on whether we describe the representational relation analytically, in terms of the ‘substance’ of this relation (as with reductive naturalism, a substance devoid of “pragmatic elements”; see 91), or practically, deflating this relation and focusing instead on the use of representational sources in generating corroborated inferences about their targets. Classic substantivism views representation in terms of the similarity of a target and a source, or their isomorphism (or weaker, their homomorphism, or other morphism). A recognized problem with substantivism is the phenomenon of misrepresentation (113): where there is no target, or where a target lacks relevant properties, there can be no representation on the substance view as there are no grounds for similarity or isomorphism, and so no misrepresentation.
In contrast, Suárez’s theory of model representation has two components. First, a source represents a target only if the ‘representational force’ of the source “points toward” (9) the target (166). The notion of representational force is understood weakly: a source is directed to the target, and nothing else. The significance of representational force is that this direction is determined practically, in accordance with intended social use (119). This is the deflationary aspect of Suárez’s conception. There’s nothing about the source or the target, in themselves, that necessitates representational force. It follows that anything can represent anything else, the relevant social practice willing (47, 85, 189).
Secondly, on Suárez’s view, a source represents a target only if a source has a “specific inferential capacity” toward a target (166). Inferential capacity comes in two forms. First, there are vertical rules of inference, rules that “apply to the internal workings of the sources considered as self-standing objects” (184). Drawing from Heinrich Hertz, models (Bilder, for Hertz; 38–39) exhibit ‘conformity’. They possess an internal, “inferential structure” (39) that grants them “a life of their own” (184), one that is “thoroughly social” (227). On the other hand, to serve the purpose of representing a target, a source’s inferential capacity involves horizontal rules of inference “essentially linked to [this source’s social] purposes in surrogative reasoning”, here reasoning about a target to the point of making licensed predictions about the target’s behaviour.
The implications of Suárez’s theory of representation are many. Chapter 7 illustrates the valuable use of surrogative reasoning in Suárez’s chosen case studies, cited above. Also, the application of Suárez’s theory to the philosophy of art opens “a Pandora's box of new questions” as soon as one draws licensed inferences from artworks in a “cultural and political context” (222). Further, Suárez’s deflationism breathes new life into van Fraassen’s constructive empiricism (242–243), now freed of cumbersome metaphysics.
Overall, one would have expected Suárez, given his retrospective position, to have spent more time reviewing published objections to his view. He orients his deflationism in the context of R.I.G. Hughes’ (1997) DDI account (141), arguing that his notion of representational force (“denotative function”) is an improvement on what Hughes calls ‘denotation’ (147–151). On the other hand, Roman Frigg and James Nguyen’s recent DEKI account is ignored, along with its critique of Suárez’s inferentialism. For example, Nguyen and Frigg (2022) object that Suárez fails to satisfactorily answer the “Semantic question: in virtue of what does a model represent its target” (7). Typically, we have an idea about the ‘meaning’ of a model prior to saying what inferences a model prescribes. Inferentialism works the other way. Since representational force, as noted above, is utterly deflated—anything can represent anything else—inferential capacity is the primary driver of meaning. With only inferences at hand, “there is no substantial analysis to be given about scientific representation” (Nguyen and Frigg 2022, 45), about what models represent or mean.
In specifying what it is in virtue of which a model represents a target, we need to say something about what a model is (about what Nguyen and Frigg call a “model object”, 66). This is not to ask for the necessary or sufficient conditions for being a model (its ‘constitution’). It is to ask, in a case where a model represents target, what specifically the model is—what thing it is—that is doing the targeting, just as when someone drives a car we ask, specifically, who is doing the driving, and not for the necessary or sufficient conditions for being a driver. Take, then, Suárez’s case of the Forth Rail Bridge. The (scale) model in this case is a set of engineering blueprints, some of which Suárez reproduces (62–63). These blueprints are the source, the model, and the target is the physical bridge. This is almost right. I have another copy of Suárez’s book, with the same blueprints. I don’t, therefore, have two distinct models of the bridge. It’s one model reproduced twice, reproduced many times in all the copies of the book, reproduced anthropomorphically as on the cover of Suárez’s book, which is itself reproduced multiple times with multiple copies of the book, and so on. So, in specifying what model it is that targets the physical Forth Rail Bridge, we need to look beyond the blueprints. This has nothing to do with the abstractness of the blueprints as a representation of the bridge. The anthropomorphic model is concrete, and with it, too, we need to look beyond the people in the depiction, to the same model that is at issue with the blueprints.
These comments are not original. They speak to the need for caution in talking in a facile way about models, or model objects. Nguyen and Frigg are aware of this need and highlight the relevant ontological issues. One can look at models as (set-theoretic) structures or as fictional entities (2022, 66). Suárez focuses on disputing the structure approach (138). For example, the Forth Rail Bridge blueprints are not set-theoretic. Their creator was not a modern logician. On the other hand, Suárez does not discuss a fictional approach. Arguably, the blueprints are not fictional since both they and the bridge are physically real. The question, for us, is whether Suárez’s deflationism handles this ontological quandary about models.
Consider again the question of the car and who the driver of the car is. A deflationist on this matter sidelines questions about the identity of this individual. Substantivist approaches, such as those based on similarity or isomorphism, encounter counterexamples since, analogously to Suárez’s arguments about models, potential car drivers need not be similar nor isomorphic to one another. The turn to a practical, or ‘means’ inquiry recommends that we look at the socially sanctioned practices of car drivers, without settling on the constitution of these drivers. For example, we might note that car drivers perform certain actions under certain circumstances, and different actions under different circumstances. A full description of these contextualized practices answers the question for a deflationist about who the driver is.
Is this a satisfactory answer to the analogous ontological question about drivers? Not if we think it matters who the driver is, leaving aside the question of their constitutional identity. At the traffic stop, a police officer will ask for the driver’s license and registration in order to pick out the relevant legal individual, not to define this person in terms of the necessary or sufficient conditions for being a driver. It’s a matter of ascribing responsibility for the driver's actions. A deflationist answer, substituting the legal individual with a set of actions practically distinguished by the interests of a community, is misleading since the same individual could perform a different set of actions, and a different individual could perform the same set of actions.
Consider now the Forth Rail Bridge. If one wants a reason for why the bridge has not toppled, one points to the relevant model. We access this model by viewing the blueprints. The blueprints aren’t the model since the blueprints are not responsible for why the bridge has not toppled. One can destroy all the blueprints and the bridge will still not topple. That the bridge has not toppled, or in more scientific cases, the success of one’s inferential practices, does not explain the lack of toppling or the bridge’s continued standing. These points are not distant from Suárez’s thinking. In discussing the Lotke-Volterra equations, Suárez notes that merely satisfying these equations is not enough to explain an observable phenomenon, such as the correlation between predator and prey numbers in the Adriatic Sea, since this correlation could be “entirely spurious or arbitrary” (114). Thus, the Lotke-Volterra theoretical model is more than just the equations and the inferential practices they prescribe. There is something in the world that corresponds to this model, something we have captured in our thinking, something ensuring that the model is not, as Suárez says, “predictively inane” (114). If the Lotke-Volterra model simply prescribes “a nonlinear pair of intermingled equations” and imposes “no requirements whatever on the nature of the objects involved as source or target or their relation” (172), there will be “no explanatory fact underlying the correlation” (114). To me, this sounds like an abandonment of inferentialism.
These critical points aside, Suárez’s book is a richly argued model of scholarship that sets the standard for future investigations into scientific representation.
REFERENCES
Hughes, R.I.G. (1997), “Models and Representation,” Philosophy of Science 64: S325–S336.
Nguyen, J. and R. Frigg (2022), Scientific Representation. Cambridge University Press.