David Snoke’s book, Interpreting Quantum Mechanics: Modern Foundations, is an engaging and comprehensive introduction to interpretative issues in quantum mechanics. It provides an accessible presentation of the field which would be useful for students and teachers, and it also offers a valuable technical resource for researchers in both physics and philosophy.
Part I provides a nonmathematical exposition of quantum mechanics. It also presents and defends Snoke’s principal interpretative thesis: that quantum fields and waves should be taken literally as elements of reality, closely analogous to water waves and light waves. The writing here is vivid, fast-paced and entertaining. It is clear enough to be accessible even to those with no background in the field, but would also be useful for those with more experience to further build intuition. Snoke offers compelling visualizations for complex phenomena such as first versus second quantization, Pauli exclusion and its connection to solidity, and Bell’s theorem. This section of the book aptly demonstrates the great pedagogical value of Snoke’s approach to quantum mechanics.
Parts II–IV largely focus on giving a technical introduction to various important features of quantum mechanics and quantum field theory. Research on the interpretation of quantum mechanics sometimes focuses on overly simplified scenarios, sidestepping modern developments in QFT; so, Snoke’s clear and accessible expositions of detailed technical topics, and particularly issues relevant to real experimental techniques, is very welcome and will certainly be of value to researchers in the field. While Snoke’s interpretive commitments inform some of the presentation, this section of the book is in effect an introductory quantum mechanics textbook, and could be used as such without any need to delve into the interpretational issues presented in Part I; from the point of view of the overarching goal of the book, it might have been helpful to offer some more explicit discussion of what these technical results have to tell us about the matters of interpretation introduced in Part I.
An important theme of the book is the idea that misconceptions about quantum mechanics can be addressed by studying our modern understanding of these phenomena in terms of quantum field theory. In particular, Snoke debunks a number of misconceptions arising from ideas proposed early in the development of the field which no longer reflect the modern theory, but which have lived on in the popular imagination and in pedagogy. For example, chapter 10 explains Planck’s famous explanation for the failure of the Rayleigh-Jeans radiation law, then demonstrates how Planck’s formula can be derived from quantum field theory, thus demonstrating that the resolution of the paradox does not depend on employing a particle picture. Snoke’s discussions of these misconceptions are a powerful demonstration of the importance of taking QFT into account when studying the interpretation of quantum mechanics.
Throughout the book, Snoke is particularly concerned to draw a contrast between particles and fields, with the former being merely a ‘mental model’ whereas the latter are to be taken literally as elements of reality. He argues that quantum fields should be considered just as ‘real’ as other kinds of fields, such as electromagnetic fields and water: ‘Real water waves are, of course, fully quantum in a universe governed by QM. . . .If we ascribe reality to the water field we see, there is no mathematical justification to treat other kinds of quantum fields differently.’ However, the use of the word ‘reality’ here is somewhat imprecise. In what sense is a water field real? It is not a fundamental constituent of reality: ‘water’ is a higher-level, emergent feature of reality that conveniently characterizes behaviour exhibited in certain physical regimes. It is a ‘real pattern,’ in the terms popularized by Daniel Dennett (1991) and David Wallace (2012). And the same, surely, is true of particles: they are not fundamental constituents of reality, but they are a ‘real pattern,’ a convenient way of describing features of the theory that emerge in certain regimes. So if it is true that quantum fields are ‘real’ in the same sense as water fields, this does not really support Snoke’s thesis that quantum fields are more ‘real’ than particles: rather it suggests that both particles and fields are simply emergent descriptions which are appropriate in certain regimes and may break down in others. As Snoke rightly emphasizes, the wave/field paradigm is more widely applicable than the particle paradigm, and in that sense it is reasonable to prefer the wave/field description in many circumstances, but that does not necessarily mean the wave/field paradigm is literally true at all scales. After all, many physicists believe that QFT encounters a cutoff around the Planck scale, with other physics taking over at smaller scales, and if this is the case then fields may not be fundamental constituents of reality any more than particles are.
Stylistically Snoke is concerned to emphasize the analogies between quantum fields and other kinds of fields, which sometimes leads to understating the disanalogies. From a pedagogical point of view this makes sense: as Snoke ably demonstrates, comparing quantum fields to classical waves is a powerful tool to help visualize the mathematics of quantum theory. However, from the interpretative standpoint one might worry that Snoke’s emphasis on classical analogies sometimes stands in the way of a full appreciation of the differences between the classical and quantum worlds. For example, Snoke argues that there is no good reason to treat quantum fields any differently to other fields, but then later notes that without making alterations to quantum mechanics, taking the fields literally leads to the many-worlds interpretation. Since Snoke himself offers a thorough accounting of a number of serious difficulties for the many-worlds interpretation in chapter 5, he surely ought to agree that this represents an obstacle to taking the fields literally. And even for those who are happy to accept the many-worlds approach, one might think that branching into multiple worlds still represents a significant conceptual difference between quantum fields and ordinary fields.
Of course, Snoke himself advocates a variant on the spontaneous collapse interpretation, the details of which are set out in chapter 20, and so perhaps his intention is simply to use the argument that we should take the fields literally as a step on the road to convincing us to adopt a spontaneous collapse approach. But since the mathematics of standard quantum mechanics does not currently include spontaneous collapse, this route cannot claim the virtue of simply taking the theory literally as it stands. Snoke’s own spontaneous collapse approach has a number of appealing features—in particular, the fact that it makes use of decoherence to define collapses provides a satisfying link between the ‘effective collapse’ defined by decoherence and the literal collapses postulated by the model. However, the approach is not yet fully general, and the difficulty of extending such an approach to cover all of QFT should not be underestimated—no modification of standard QM has yet succeeded in reproducing all of the predictions of QFT.
In addition, Snoke’s model, like other spontaneous collapse approaches, has significant difficulties with relativistic covariance, since we are required to select a preferred reference frame on which non-local actions can take place. In his discussion of this point Snoke advocates simply selecting a ‘natural’ rest frame, by appeal to the cosmic microwave background or something of that kind. However, although this is technically feasible, it seems to amount to a refusal to fully conceptualize the relativistic nature of the fields in question. Earlier Snoke emphasizes that the central difference between relativistic quantum fields and the earlier ether picture is that the ‘medium’ on which the relativistic fields propagate ‘looks different from different perspectives, but it is always there.’ But adopting a preferred reference frame seems to disregard this observation, ensuring that there is a specific perspective which gives the ‘correct’ description of the underlying fields, and thus there is a sense in which Snoke’s approach does not really succeed in interpreting relativistic quantum fields on their own terms. This is perhaps an indication that some of the classical analogies are being taken too far.
At some points, the discussion might have benefited from greater attention to the philosophical literature as well as the physics literature. For example, in chapter 16 Snoke offers an argument aiming to show that the many-worlds interpretation is non-local. The locality of the many-worlds approach is a subtle and still controversial topic (Bacciagaluppi, 2002; Ney, forthcoming), which depends on the specific ontology one associates with the many-worlds thesis as well as on the way in which one defines ‘locality.’ Snoke’s discussion here does not fully account for the philosophical work that has been done in this area. In particular, Snoke’s discussion appears to be treating the ‘worlds’ as fundamental, precisely-defined entities, whereas many modern proponents of the Everett interpretation understand worlds as approximate and emergent phenomena appearing only in the limit of sufficient decoherence (Wallace, 2010; Wallace, 2012). The difference between these two approaches to the Everett interpretation has a significant impact on the judgements we might make over locality. Perhaps, then, the emergentist Everettian approach should have been discussed more explicitly.
While questions remain about whether the literal approach advocated by Snoke can fully resolve all the interpretative puzzles of quantum mechanics, its pedagogical value is undeniable and Snoke’s clarification of ongoing misconceptions about quantum theory represent a valuable contribution to the field. The book will no doubt go on to become a valued resource for students, teachers and researchers in quantum mechanics and QFT.
REFERENCES
Dennett, Daniel C., ‘Real patterns.’ Journal of Philosophy, 88 (1) (1991), pp. 27–51.
Wallace, David M., The emergent multiverse: Quantum theory according to the Everett interpretation, Oxford University Press, Oxford (2012).
Bacciagaluppi, G. (2002). ‘Remarks on Space-Time and Locality in Everett’s Interpretation’ in: Placek, T., Butterfield, J. (eds), Non-locality and Modality. NATO Science Series, vol 64. Springer, Dordrecht.
Ney, Alyssa (forthcoming). ‘The Argument from Locality for Many Worlds Quantum Mechanics’ Journal of Philosophy.
Wallace, David (2010). ‘Decoherence and Ontology, or: How I Learned To Stop Worrying And Love FAPP’ in Simon Saunders, Jonathan Barrett, Adrian Kent & David Wallace (eds.), Many Worlds?: Everett, Quantum Theory, & Reality. Oxford, GB: Oxford University Press UK.