This magnum opus synthesizes themes from over two decades of Danielle Allen’s theoretical and applied work. It is a major contribution to the philosophical literature on sociopolitical justice. Written in an engaging style, Allen’s explanations are carefully reasoned, poised, always clear, and reassuringly balanced throughout—as might be expected of a scholar expert in classical thought, the American founders, and contemporary theories of justice and society. While Allen’s egalitarian conception of justice has some radical implications for constitutional and social reform, her arguments never descend into ideological cant. Readers who initially resist aspects of her account will be earnestly engaged and challenged to answer her illuminating conceptual taxonomies and the empirical evidence on which she draws. One feels throughout a confident force of reason that comes from grappling with a wide variety of approaches within political philosophy, along with many contextualized applications and examples.
While much of Allen’s book is devoted to laying out a near-comprehensive new account, rather than defending it in detail against rival theories (which would have overburdened this work), its ambitiousness is evident in Allen’s main goals and the structure of her theory. She frames her project as a correction to John Rawls’s account in A Theory of Justice and later books, which led to what Allen calls a “quasi-Rawlsian welfarism” in liberal policymaking that focuses on applying his Difference Principle narrowly to wealth and income. Allen urges us to refocus on “social and political phenomena that underlie economic conditions,” and especially on power-asymmetries and group dynamics within social relations (20). Rawls was wrong to put substantive ideals of democratic politics and civil society in second place; an adequate theory of justice must make democratic values the top priority.
This complaint that Rawls’s theory is skewed by subordinating the “liberty of the ancients” and making political rights too sacrificeable to negative liberties (22) is hardly unprecedented: Allen’s concern resonates with similar arguments by Jürgen Habermas and Elizabeth Anderson (171), among others. Her insistence that civil liberties, “political equality, and autonomy-securing rights” be recognized as “co-original and co-equal” (24) makes her fundamental starting-point similar to those of other egalitarians, such as Carol Gould’s principle of “equal positive liberty” based in capacities for self-transformation, Iris M. Young’s five dimensions of oppression, and Nancy Fraser’s “participatory parity” or equal substantive opportunities to participate in all arenas of shared social life (210)—which is not achievable by reducing economic inequalities alone. Allen’s account fits within the broader revival of civic republican conceptions of sociopolitical justice, which is no surprise given her long attention to the ideals of the American founders and Lincoln. This republican orientation is not emphasized, but Allen deploys Philip Pettit’s concept of “non-domination” throughout her analyses.
Two features of Allen’s account are original and striking, first, her embrace of a pragmatist sort of eudaemonism (7), and, second, the greater content that she gives to the principles of justice that must govern civil society and social relationships—if goods dependent on specific components of equal status are to be widely realized in a pluralistic nation and provide “a pathway to human well-being” (12). Formal and informal educational systems, relationships of trust and doubt, housing and transportation, banking and unbiased workplace culture, informal and formal voluntary associations / NGOs, fair districting, voting and other forms of political participation, criminal justice systems, and social capital are all recognized as vital aspects of “the basic structure” that should be governed by second- and third-level norms elaborated well beyond what Rawls and several of his respondents have offered.
Coming to the structure of her theory, after identifying very general ideals and goals found in familiar theories of just “political economy” and the “design principles” they were commonly taken to entail—such as division of labor, competitive markets, and Ricardian growth for classical liberalism—Allen identifies three highest-level design principles for human life. These are the “non-sacrificeability” of negative and positive liberties (up to some point); political equality; and “difference without domination.” They replace Rawls’s first principle with one stressing substantive capacities for action, his Equal Opportunity Principle with both non-domination (positive securities) and key equalities, and his Difference Principle with a much broader (but non-maximizing) set of conditions.
Under these, we have “subsidiary ideals” for three broad domains of life—formal political institutions, social relationships (of myriad kinds), and economic interactions. These replace Rawls’s five generic primary goods with a longer and more articulated list corresponding to a broader and more detailed conception of the basic institutions that deeply affect a person’s life-prospects. The central ideals for each of these domains are elaborated into overarching (but interconnecting) design principles. Within each domain, Allen also introduces more specific “rules and norms” that indicate how to operationalize or apply each of the main design principles. Such rules fill roughly the places occupied by subsidiary principles at the constitutional and legislative “stages” in Rawls’s theory. Allen’s alternative is thus more ambitious and also more concrete in its policy-guiding aspects. Although this makes for a more complicated theory, arguably this is needed to integrate aspects of justice that Rawls downplayed in his 1971 theory and its later more “political” sequel.
To illustrate, I will focus on Allen’s account of political equality, which develops ideas she sketched in her landmark bestseller, Our Declaration (see 82–83). Allen understands political equality not merely as a condition for the “worth” of political liberties to average citizens (Rawls’ term), but as an intrinsic and instrumental good, given that the state cannot remain neutral when legislating on issues involving conflicting conceptions of a good life. The central importance of political equality flows from the moral equality of persons, because social constraints impact our “purposiveness and capacity for autonomy” (34). And it has at least five key “facets:” non-domination, especially in political life; equal chances to participate in collective governance or the steering of society via law; “epistemic egalitarianism” recognizing the importance of information held by non-experts; reciprocity or mutual respect among co-members that entails redress of grievances and recognize interdependencies; and “co-ownership of political institutions” (36–37).
The second of these facets includes several aspects of the rule of law, which aim to “depersonalize” institutional authority—in contrast to the cults of outlandish personalities favored by today’s emotive clickbait medias—through elections, checks between the three branches, limits on office-holding, and institutions to balance the influence of different sectional interests (73–78). The first and third facets provide guidance for democratic popular sovereignty, which Allen conceives in a substantive rather than minimalist way: both fluid majorities and persistent minorities must often collaborate, through a revisable set of participatory mechanisms, in steering what the government does with its unique coordinative powers (68).
The resulting design principles for this domain of political institutions (69) demand real sharing of political power and responsibility (85). Today this requires reforms to the US system such as increasing the size of the House of Representatives to reflect state populations more accurately, proportional election of presidential electors (78), equal ballot access, ranked-choice voting to avoid spoiler effects that enforce two-party hegemony, and limits on campaign finance and independent election spending to prevent multi-millionaires from gaining vastly outsized political voice (84–85). Here I should confess my sympathetic bias, because I have defended several of these reforms in The Democracy Amendments, which is indebted to Our Common Purpose (the 2020 report on pro-democracy reforms by the American Academy of Arts and Sciences that Allen co-chaired). Today we must add the need for term limits in a Supreme Court that keeps enlarging its democracy-destroying control.
Allen argues that such egalitarian participatory ideals should extend to civil society organizations (86). This raises a potentially hard question: many citizens may prefer to delegate most of their rightful share of power in civil society, as well as in elections, to others in order to reduce their own participatory labors, even on Allen’s flexible conception of them (219). Is it enough if they do this except when aggregate effects of such delegation enable domination of whole groups? On this topic, Allen could have considered the inalienability of some parts of both negative and positive liberties.
The fifth facet of political equality is the responsibility involved in co-ownership of institutional capital—especially formal political institutions and informal shared expectations (e.g., to value democratic forms as precious). Here I would extend Allen’s approach by emphasizing many types of capital that need to be partly or wholly owned in collective ways (43). In addition to the epistemic capital she recognizes in the crowdsourcing of information in democratic decision-making, there are also heritages of scientific and historical knowledge, know-how across the trades, literature and art (cultural capital) in multiple traditions, infrastructure in manifold forms (most subject to natural monopolies), and natural resources/environmental capital.
This revision would move Allen’s account towards a “distributivist” version of civic republicanism, in which equal access to all kinds of naturally collective capital is a birthright, and civic duties to maintain these vital endowments require all citizens to cooperate as trustees. This could also give a theory of public goods a stronger role in Allen’s conception of justice. While she mentions public goods at several junctures (41, 116, 160), a more robust account of common goods could help explain key points for economic justice. For example, the anti-rival nature of network goods can make them monopolistic if furnished within markets (166)—as Microsoft, Apple, Google, and Amazon have proven. Similarly, reciprocity requires overcoming free rider or distributive inequity problems that block some public goods.
More generally, the sorts of collective action problems and market failures that must be overcome to coordinate common goods determine what powers government should have in a just society (which I call Hamilton’s Consolidation principle—CP). One can divide the theoretical labor by using CP to discern what capacities each level of government should have—which Allen follows Hamilton in calling “energy” in government—while employing political equality to determine who should have steering control over the uses of such powers. Democratic conceptions will align the ultimate public controllers with those directly coordinated by such uses. Collective action analysis must also guide the design of decision-making procedures, because excessive veto-points lead to paralysis in legislative processes (86–94).
Allen’s analysis really shines in evaluating forms of social capital and how to structure them to allow “difference without domination”—that is, types of association and group-dynamics that do not produce excessive power-asymmetries (ch.4). She emphasizes the need to limit rights-to-exclude classes of people from formal associations (e.g., trade groups) and informal networks, which can enable opportunity-hording. I would add that access to forms of social power cannot be maximined due to their essentially comparative / zero-sum nature. Allen argues convincingly, drawing on Yascha Mounk and other social psychologists, that it is vital to expand “linking” social capital for underprivileged people, while reducing more harmful forms of bonding capital (50–56). Social groupings are fostered by social systems, and overly insular in-group-affiliation can greatly limit people’s opportunities by cutting them off from helpful knowledge and skills (164) and promoting excessive suspicion of out-groups (107–25).
This imperative to teach “the art of bridging” and foster more cosmopolitan bonding relationships (125) should make us question whether emphasizing ascriptive group identities so much has reached counterproductive excess (110), for people are also unique individuals. Pushing young people to expand their linking capital through anti-insularity programs or nonpartisan civic associations and political groups might become essential in an era of AI-driven life in virtual reality bubbles.
Allen’s goal of an “associational ecosystem” that fosters power-sharing across culturally and economically divided groups and builds “political friendship” (209) is her broadened version of Rawls’s Equal Opportunity Principle, which only requires people with similar raw aptitudes and motivation to have roughly equal access to positions with similar levels of pay and power. She shows that equal opportunity to participate across all aspects of civil society would require restructuring numerous processes that affect differential formation of social capital (101–3) and job options (167–68, 177–79). Still, Allen does not fully clarify what role different sorts of meritocratic selection criteria ought to play in a just society while avoiding potential domination.
More generally, difference without domination will clearly require limiting or burdening negative liberties to some extent to foster more equal positive capacities. Allowing people free use of their liberties in contexts like labor markets and choice of residence without generating aggregate results that enable domination could require moderate forms of paternalism/maternalism, such as mandatory savings. Social Security furnishes one example, but so would requiring workers to be part-owners of companies that employ them (172), or nudging people away from endless renter status towards home or condo ownership, or trying to unsort / remix self-segregated populations. And promoting job mobility, as Allen’s rich account of economic justice rightly demands, might require proactive steps that encourage more willingness to relocate for work (167–68). Of course, it also requires more portable health insurance and steps to rebuild smaller cities that can offer good jobs with lower costs of living.
Investment in bridging across siloed firms (with their dubious non-compete labor contracts) and public-private divides is also crucial for economic justice (180–82). Allen calls for more specific democratic steering of the economy to promote a wide range of jobs by investing in certain sectors, as opposed to leaving all production planning to venture capitalists and central bankers (177–78, 182–86; compare Mariana Mazzucato and Ha-Joon Chang). One might push Allen’s trajectory further here to fundamentally reform corporate law, strengthen antitrust law with hard caps on permissible market shares, require firms over certain sizes to be publicly owned, and stop financial sector vampirism. However, Allen tries to avoid setting specific targets to be achieved by redistributive methods (179), and despite her insights concerning the processes—including education and socialization—required for a just political economy, more determinative principles concerning distributive equity would be helpful.
Similarly, I’m not fully convinced by Allen’s approach to immigration. There are fundamental questions about the division of the world into nations that her theory does not yet address, although it is well-equipped to refute mistaken appeals to freedom of association as grounds for closed borders. She argues convincingly that, in principle, membership rights (paths to citizenship) should “maximize the freedom of labor to move” to match global capital mobility (139–41); but in practice, we must also reduce socio-cultural frictions that large scale migration causes. Yet her main proposal is to follow Canada in allowing all civil society organizations to sponsor would-be immigrants in order to help them get jobs, improve their integration, and protect their rights (152–54). This is inadequate.
First, today’s ethnonationalist backlashes are driven more by irregular migration and massive increases in asylum applications. Second, even for economic migrants, relying on sponsorship to determine who gets membership status risks allowing stronger and richer groups within a nation to prioritize admitting more of “their own,” creating demographic arms races. Major developed countries instead need a coalition to overcome their game-of-chicken efforts to push migrants elsewhere, share the burdens fairly, admit refugees and economic migrants based on a number of legitimate criteria, and be able to direct where they live for some period of time after entrance. The willingness of group sponsors to help new immigrants can be only one factor among many.
I have hardly mentioned some of Allen’s intriguing ideas concerning topics such as promoting civic knowledge and responsible citizenship, reducing exploitation, what constitutes good jobs, and possible division of labor in political participation. Any reader interested in sociopolitical justice will find in Allen’s book content that speaks to them—and be challenged by the combination of approaches across different fields that she synthesizes so well.