Readers of Kant’s third Critique, the Critique of the Power of Judgment, are presented with a set of puzzles about the unity, indeed, the very existence, of the very book before them: why did Kant think his critical system was ‘incomplete’ without a critique of the power of judgment, and why would such a critique complete that system? Why must that critique contain a critique of aesthetic judgment and a critique of teleological judgment? Are each equally necessary to the critical project? To borrow a trope from Kant himself, is this book a mere aggregate of its parts, or is it unified by an idea of the whole that determines those parts? And if so, what is that idea, and does it determine that the third Critique must have these, and only these, parts (no more, no fewer)?
Ido Geiger’s excellent new book, Kant and the Claims of the Empirical World: a Transcendental Reading of the Critique of the Power of Judgment, offers a bold new take on some of these foundational issues about the unity and structure of the third Critique. Geiger’s leading thread is that the CPJ continues the project, begun in the Critique of Pure Reason (CPR), of uncovering transcendental conditions for the possibility of experience. In the Introduction Kant announces that the account of the transcendental conditions of experience in the CPR is incomplete because it does not explain how empirical cognition of the particular laws of Nature is possible (i.e., the specific laws that govern Nature, as opposed to the transcendental principle that there must be such laws.) Kant’s solution is to introduce a new transcendental principle, which he calls the principle of the ‘logical purposiveness of Nature for our cognition’: in inquiring into Nature, we must reflectively judge (roughly, unite given particulars under a common concept) as if Nature were purposely created by a wise Author for the sake of our cognizing it, although we cannot positively assert that it was so created. (Such a claim about the non-spatiotemporal cause of Nature would violate the restrictions on our cognition argued for in the CPR.) The logical purposiveness of Nature provides the unifying thread of Geiger’s reading of the CPJ.
Geiger defends seven main theses about the structure and aims of the third Critique:
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- The principle of the purposiveness of Nature for our cognitive capacities is a transcendental principle of experience.
- The deduction of this principle is not completed in the Introduction but, instead, in §77 of the Critique of Teleological Judgment.
- Pure aesthetic judgments about Nature (i.e., judgments of natural beauty) are transcendental conditions of the possibility of experience.
- The role of the Critique of Teleological Judgment, and its discussion of organisms, is also, ultimately, to justify the assumption of the logical purposiveness of Nature as a whole (see 2).
- Furthermore, §77 of the Critique of Teleological Judgment contains the most complete presentation of Kant’s argument that natural explanation, for us, must take the form of mechanical explanation: explanation of the existence of a whole by means of the actions of its parts.
- Although all natural explanations, even of organisms, must be mechanistic, mechanistic explanations need not be reductive. In particular, we can explain the mechanical (part-to-whole) generation of a living thing from another living thing, whose existence in turn we cannot explain mechanistically (and thus cannot explain at all). In other words, living things can be inputs to mechanical explanation, but never outputs.
- The aim of the Dialectic of Teleological Judgment is to show that there is no contradiction, but instead a relation of complementarity, between its Thesis and Antithesis, if these are expressed as regulative maxims for judgment.
Readers familiar with the literature on the third Critique will note immediately how controversial many of these claims are (especially 3). They will also note how much weight Geiger puts on §77 (it plays a key role in 2 and 5). There are other important and intriguing ideas in the book but these seven are what I take to be the philosophical heart of the book. For reasons of space, I will focus on 1 and 2; while I agree with Geiger about 1, I find his arguments for 2 unconvincing.
In the Introduction to the third Critique Kant announces a new transcendental principle, the principle of the logical purposiveness of Nature (PLPN, for short). The a priori formal principles of experience uncovered in the first Critiqueexplain why Nature has laws, necessary universal laws concerning causal interactions among spatiotemporal substances. But these purely formal principles leave undetermined which particular laws govern Nature and thus determine neither (a) whether these laws constitute a system nor (b) whether this system is empirically discoverable by us, even in principle. While I have expressed this in Kantian jargon, the problem Kant is concerned with can be stated very intuitively. Assuming that there are laws of nature, and laws are not understood as mere Humean empirical regularities, but necessary truths grounded in the real essences of natural kinds, how do we know empirically what the laws are? Experience, indeed, even experience of ideal empirical regularity, tells us neither which sets of objects constitute natural kinds (as opposed to kinds composed of superficially similar objects belonging to distinct such kinds, like jade) nor which regularities are genuine laws (as opposed to accidental regularities).
After stating this problem Kant immediately asserts that the only way for us to experience the laws of Nature is by assuming a new transcendental principle.
The reflecting power of judgment, which is under the obligation of ascending from the particular in the natural to the universal, therefore requires a principle that it cannot borrow from experience [. . .] this principle can be nothing other than this: [. . .] the particular empirical laws [. . .] must be considered in terms of the sort of unity they would have if an understanding (even if not ours) had likewise given them for the sake of our faculty of cognition. Not as if in this way such an understanding must really be assumed. (5:180)
In case there was any doubt in the reader’s mind that this is a transcendental principle, Kant titles the next section ‘The principle of the formal purposiveness of nature is a transcendental principle of the power of judgment.’ Let’s distinguish three claims: (a) the transcendental principles of the possibility of experience from the 1st Critique alone do not explain how empirical cognition of the particular laws of nature is possible, (b) the principle of the logical purposiveness of nature (as a principle of reflecting judgment) is sufficient to fill this gap, (c) it is necessary to fill this gap. First note that (a) does not entail (b), which in turn does not entail (c). Note further that Kant is not only claiming (b); he is claiming (c). He writes: ‘a transcendental principle is one through which is represented the universal a priori condition under which alonethings can become objects of our cognition at all’ (5:181, see also 5:180, 183, 184, and 186).
Kant’s argument, such as it is, for this very substantive claim seems to be condensed into three long sentences on 5:184, immediately before the paragraph that begins ‘In order to be convinced of the correctness of this deduction of the concept that is before us, etc.’ (5:184). Geiger’s proposal is that this ‘deduction’ is incomplete and is only completed much later, in §77 of the Critique of Teleological Judgment.
Textually, though, Geiger has a high bar to clear because prima facie Kant’s explicit concern in §77 is purposiveness as a principle for reflecting judgment about ‘particular products of nature,’ i.e., organisms, rather than about the system of natural laws. While laws are mentioned in §77, they are mentioned in order to distinguish mechanical laws (laws about mechanical or part-to-whole causation) from teleological laws. But the problem of knowledge of the particular laws of Nature from the Introduction is independent of Kant’s claim that natural causation is exclusively mechanical. Even if there were laws of teleological causation in Nature, we would still face the problem of how we could come to know them empirically: How do we know empirically how to sort organisms into natural kinds? How do we distinguish the teleological laws from mere teleological accidental generalizations?
In Geiger’s discussion of §77 I can find three main arguments for the principle of the logical purposiveness of nature:
1. The argument from systematicity. Geiger writes:
Kant concludes by claiming that the principle of the “purposiveness of nature in its products is a concept that is necessary for the human power of judgment in regard to nature” but that it does not “pertain to the determination of the objects themselves.” In other words, it is a “subjective principle of reason for the power of judgment” that we view nature as purposive for our discursive understanding. We view nature as though it were constituted by unities that can be subsumed under universal concepts. Although Kant does not make the point explicit in the passage before us, the last claim is, in fact, tantamount to the claim that we view nature as though it were systematically constituted by unities that can be subsumed under a comprehensive system of universal concepts. (102)
But this is not correct. The claim that Nature constitutes a system (either of natural laws or natural kinds) is not ‘tantamount’ to the claim that Nature is purposive for our cognition. After all, that system could be so complicated and its species could correspond so poorly to the manifest similarities among objects from which we begin empirical inquiry, that it would be in principle impossible for us to ever uncover the underlying laws of Nature. Nor do I think that an argument for the systematicity of Nature is contained in §77 of the Critique of Judgment; I think that argument is contained in the Appendix to the Transcendental Dialectic in the first Critique. But since my focus is the principle of the logical purposiveness of Nature, I won’t dwell any further on the systematicity argument.
2. The complete determination argument. Along similar lines, Geiger writes
The thought is that only the complete determination of our system of concepts can ground the claims to objectivity we make when we subsume a particular under an empirical concept. This is why the assumption of the comprehensive conceptual purposiveness of Nature underwrites any subsumption of a particular under an empirical concept. (111)
Again, though, I don’t think this follows. Even if we grant Kant the assumption that a completely determined system of concepts is a precondition for subsumption of particulars under empirical concepts, it does not follow that this system must be purposive for our cognition. So I don’t see any argument yet here for the PLPN.
3. Conceptual hierarchies and part-whole causation.
Geiger insightfully connects the discussion of parts and wholes in §77 to the mereological structure of the conceptual hierarchy of empirical concepts itself (from which derives the hierarchy of natural laws). On Kant’s view, more general concepts are the partial marks of which lower-level concepts are composed, e.g., <animal> is a proper part of the conceptual whole <human> = <rational + animal>. At one point Geiger suggests that we can derive the PLPN from the mereological structure of conceptual hierarchies themselves, which is, plausibly, a direct consequence of the discursive nature of our understanding (the main theme of §77).
First of all, from this alone it does not follow that our concepts form or even ideally form a system—for the mereological structure of our concepts does not entail that all of our concepts participate in the same hierarchy and thus constitute a system, i.e., that they are composed of the same conceptual marks. For all that the discursive nature of our understanding alone entails, we might be fully content with natural species that share no common genus, so that our conceptual hierarchies are not even systematic in the ‘ideal’ case. As long as we have a natural species for each empirical object, the discursive form of our understanding by itself does not explain why it is not a matter of indifference to us whether there are common genera that unify these different species. (Kant argues against this possibility in the Appendix to the Dialectic, but I think it relies on considerations about the capacity of reason, which are not contained in the mere fact that we have a discursive understanding.)
Secondly, even if we grant that a single system constitutes some kind of rational ideal for our empirical conceptualizing, we have not yet arrived at anything like an argument for the PLPN, for two reasons. For one thing, it generates the wrong order of final causes. Consider this passage from §77, which I think is the closest Kant comes in that section to an argument for PLPN:
Thus if we would not represent the possibility of the whole as depending upon the parts, as is appropriate for our discursive understanding, but would rather, after the model of the intuitive (archetypical) understanding, represent the possibility of the parts (as far as both their constitution and their combination is concerned) as depending upon the whole, then, given the very same special characteristic of our understanding, this cannot come about by the whole being the ground of the possibility of the connection of the parts (which would be a contradiction in the discursive kind of cognition), but only by the representation of a whole containing the ground of the possibility of its form and of the connection of parts that belongs to that. But now since the whole would in that case be an effect (product) the representation of which would be regarded as the cause of its possibility, but the product of a cause whose determining ground is merely the representation of its effect is called an end, it follows that it is merely a consequence of the particular constitution of our understanding that we represent products of nature as possible only in accordance with another kind of causality than that of the natural laws of matter, namely only in accordance with that of ends and final causes, and that this principle does not pertain to the possibility of such things themselves (even considered as phenomena) in accordance with this sort of generation, but pertains only to the judging of them that is possible for our understanding. (5:407–8, quoted by Geiger on p.107)
There’s a lot going on in this passage, but let’s just grant Kant the assumption that we must reflectively judge some objects as though the representation of the whole makes possible their parts. Applied to individual objects in Nature, this gets us the right result: we judge them as though the representation of the whole makes possible their parts and thus we judge them as though the whole is the end for the sake of which the parts exist, i.e., we judge them teleologically (as though they are products of art). But if we apply this to empirical concepts, we get the following: we reflectingly judge them as though the species (the whole) is the end for the sake of which the genus (the parts) exists. This entails that the lowest-level species (the species which are not also genera), which are not parts of any further concepts, are the ends for which the genera exist. However, in his most complete discussion of the systematicity of empirical concepts, in the Appendix to the Transcendental Dialectic, Kant makes clear that we should judge the whole of the system of concepts, rather than the lowest-level species, as though it is the end (final cause) of its parts, which includes both species and genera (A645/B673).
But, more importantly, this entails nothing about purposiveness for our cognition. At most this is an argument for the purposiveness of the system of empirical concepts for itself (it is cause and effect of itself), but we as cognizers have not been introduced into the teleological order (bearing in mind this teleological order is an order according to which we reflectively judge; we do not claim that the system is a teleological product.) Now we might try to supplement this argument by saying that it is an argument that we must reflectingly judge empirical concepts as though they are part of a system teleologically designed to be a system and thus purposive for our cognition, because our cognition requires systematicity. But systematicity is not sufficient for empirical cognizability—the system of empirical concepts could be so complicated and depart so radically from the manifest similarities among objects from which we begin empirical inquiry, that we could never discover the underlying empirical laws and distinguish them from mere accidental generalizations. So even if §77 contains an argument that the discursive character of our understanding requires us to judge objects under concepts we represent as constituting a system, that is not enough to demonstrate that the PLPN is a necessary condition of experience. So I do not see anything that justifies Geiger’s claim that §77 completes the deduction of the PLPN from the Introduction.
This is a book about some of the biggest picture structural issues about the third Critique, but this has been a rather narrowly focused review. Let me conclude by saying that there is much more to Geiger’s very rich book than the set of issues I have focused on (see 1–7 above). At a relatively slim 225 pages, it packs quite a philosophical punch. Any philosopher interested in Kant’s Critique of the Power of Judgment should read it.