There are two major issues raised in Karl Ameriks’s book. The first concerns how Kant understands what human dignity is, its ground and scope, and how we should understand the proper way of acknowledging it—what Kant called “respect” for it. The second concerns
a few specific ways in which more attention needs to be given to the surprising complexity—both good and bad—of the influence of some of Kant’s central concepts concerning issues such as race, religion, nationalism, colonialism and cosmopolitanism. (3)
The range of those influenced is broader than is standard in the philosophical literature and focuses on those that “had considerable influence in the political as well as intellectual world”, figures such as J.G. Herder, H.S. Chamberlain, Thomas Jefferson, Richard Price and (especially) Thomas Mann, to whom three concluding chapters are dedicated. Ameriks admits later (196) that this can seem like a “cabinet of curiosities”, but he argues against any contrary picture of philosophy and its fate as straightforward development, notes that philosophy is more like an art than a science, and freely concedes that accounts of the reception of ideas should be presented more like a story.
This story of the misinterpretations and even perversions of Kant’s ideas about dignity is a mostly dispiriting one, something not at all unusual in reception history, and the clear contrasts between Kant’s own views and those who claim to speak in his name can certainly illuminate the former and the limitations of the latter, especially in the hands of someone as erudite, fair-minded and clear as Ameriks.
The first step must be to set out “the very idea of Kantian dignity”, its distinctiveness, meaning and relevance and why it has the status it does for Kant. Here, Ameriks defends a strong traditional view: dignity is unconditionally valuable, all or nothing in its quality, and it distinguishes what persons are as a matter of metaphysical necessity. Since every human being possesses the capacity (the criterial issue) to be aware of what the moral law requires and to obey its imperative, every such being should be treated as worthy of respect and must actually be treated with respect for such status. In explaining why this should be so, Ameriks adopts what he again calls a basically mainline view. That is, he defends a “status” concept of dignity, not an “achievement” view of such worthiness (i.e., as earned by what one has achieved).
This view is defended against attempts to start with a nonmoral premise as providing the argument for entitlement to respect—the mere capacity of practical reason itself, the capacity to deliberate about and set ends for oneself and to pursue them rationally. That argument goes something like: we cannot but value such a capacity to set ends (a human life would be inconceivable without it), and we cannot value our own such capacity without valuing the capacity itself, wherever it occurs. Hence, we cannot but value (respect) all other humans as such end-setting creatures (as having inherent dignity), since it is definitive of being human, and that means we must treat them as ends in themselves, never as means for us.
Ameriks argues that this approach does not reach the level of moral ambition in Kant’s account. For one thing, unavoidably conceding the value of that faculty of end-setting need not lead to unconditional respect for it as a moral duty. (We may not coherently disvalue it, but we may value it conditionally or in some degree.) For another, Kant clearly argues that dignity is an unconditional value, as is our strict obligation to respect it. This means, for Ameriks, that any account of human worth must “from the start” (30) recognize “our capacity to acknowledge the claims of pure practical reason”. This is not deducible from any nonmoral starting point; it is the starting point, the “fact of reason” (33). (Ameriks rejects any constitutive or “self-legislating” view of the moral principle, claiming that morality is simply “constituted by lawfulness”. But he also writes a page later that persons are supposed “to impose the general deliverances of reason upon themselves” (34) and that seems to return us to some self-authorizing view.)
Moreover, since the moral law itself is both unconditional and universal, then could not the respect/dignity language simply be reformulated without loss as: no human being may be treated in any way inconsistent with what the moral law requires? Acknowledging such duties to others is to attribute dignity to them, and carrying out or not avoiding such obligations is respecting them as of unconditional (inestimable) worth. Is the dignity/respect pair anything more, anything deeper, than this, or just a more perspicuous, even more humanistically formulated and so more substantive statement of Kant’s moral theory, but not essential to it? My impression is that Ameriks believes the latter and thinks that appealing to it makes it easier to trace the legacy of Kant’s views in various arenas of reception, his main concern. He is certainly right about this.
So, truly acknowledging the claims of pure practical reason elevates us above all sensuous incentives, and it is this capacity that grounds the claim all human beings merit respect for their inherent dignity. In the rest of the opening chapters (wherein we get the “true Kant” by which his reception is to be judged), Ameriks deals quite effectively with a number of commonsense hesitations about such unconditional respect for everyone. It is natural enough to think, as fathers tend to tell their sons and daughters, that “respect must be earned” and the degree of respect accorded one should match achievements, or heroism or self-sacrifice or some such. But this is all compatible with never treating anyone with less than the respect they deserve as moral agents. Just because someone is a corrupt, lying bully, we are not entitled to treat them immorally, as mere means, as objects. There are indeed degrees of respect imaginable, but not degrees of “Respect” in the Kantian sense.
The following chapters trace the reception Ameriks is interested in. Herder is the first example. While there are methodological differences between Kant and Herder, Herder’s true Kantian spirit shows that “justice can still be done to endangered, diverse, and local interests even while respecting the universal status dignity of human beings” (53). He then discusses H.S. Chamberlain, Michael Lackey and other perverse appeals to Kant as an ally of or unwitting supporter of, fascism, and he discusses Kant’s own personal antisemitic and racist views (something shown in greater detail than ever before by Paul Franks).
He then turns to missed connections with the United States, or Kant’s mysterious silence on a revolution inspired by the credo (however hypocritical at the time) that it is self-evident that all men are created equal, equal in standing, not in achievement. In Kant’s case, Ameriks sides with notions discussed by Charles Mills and Lucy Allais to account for the anti-egalitarian attitudes of many Northern Europeans at the time, including Kant, and after Kant. In the words of Allais: “The ideology of white supremacy will typically involve white cognitive deficiencies…as rooted in pressures generated by deeply embedded unjust structural relations that distort the perceptions and attitudes of even those who are on top.” (115) This (cognitive deficiencies) is an ambiguous phrase, sounding as it does like a fate that has befallen someone. It may be true that racism is motivated by the preservation of self-interest, power, one’s own self-importance, and it may also be practically necessary that one hide such things from oneself in self-deceit, but self-deceit is motivated irrationality, not a cognitive deficiency, and if it is self-deceit that lets one live with oneself, it involves something one knows about oneself but hides from oneself, flees from, and so remains responsible for, and that sounds a lot less like a malady that has visited one. (See Ameriks himself later, on “untransferable responsibility, …a matter of will not unclear intellect of dim feeling” (128).)
The Kantian “avant la lettre” Richard Price is given a long discussion and analysis of his “overlapping positions” with Kant (124), particularly in their accounts of content in moral life, motivation, conditions of possibility and modes of knowledge involved. Most interesting for Ameriks is
that Kant and Price share…a ‘contextual’ approach to morality, that is, an appreciation for prephilosophical healthy understanding, empirical factors relevant to the application of principles, and the contingent conditions favorable to developing what Barbara Herman calls ‘the practice of moral judgment’ and to ‘moral literacy’. (125)
The book concludes with three chapters on “the elliptical path” of Thomas Mann, from un-Kantian chauvinist, aristocrat, anti-egalitarian and militarist, to a pro-democracy Kantian. It was not an easy or straightforward journey. Mann’s intellectual path requires Ameriks to chart his relation to the major philosophical figures that make up the late modern German tradition, with whom Mann was quite familiar, if never always on the mark. In the course of this story, Ameriks also judiciously and compellingly corrects misinterpretations of these figures, some of which show up in Mann’s early years. (Kant, the early Romantics, Novalis, Schopenhauer, Hegel, Kierkegaard, and Nietzsche are discussed, as is, outside of that tradition, Whitman.) Eventually, after the first World War, the distinctly Kantian notions of dignity and equality emerge in Mann. His belated insight, in the book’s conclusion,
allowed Mann simultaneously to affirm values from both halves of his career; as a high-profile public figure, his campaign for democracy reconfirmed his old belief in the special value of literary genius, while it also served his newfound cosmopolitan commitment to protecting the essential conditions of tolerable life for humanity. (191)