Kant’s Will at the Crossroads: An Essay on the Failings of Practical Reason

Jens Timmermann’s essay aims to give us Kant’s account of ‘practical failure’, that is, of what happens when an agent ‘deviates from the demands of reason’ (2). In doing so, Timmermann develops a distinctive treatment of the principal ideas in Kant’s moral psychology and conception of rational agency. One guiding thread is to ‘re-assert’ (153), in opposition to a recent and influential interpretive trend, that Kant’s moral conception does indeed operate with several stark dualisms—between duty and happiness, between moral and non-moral motivation, between pure practical reason and the empirically conditioned use of practical reason. On Timmermann’s reading, Kant held that the human being is moved by two heterogeneous kinds of incentives (moral interests and the interest in happiness) that operate in radically different ways and that, as a result, the will—by which he means the faculty of choice [Willkür]—stands at a crossroads (as Kant says at G 4:400) and must choose between them.

On Timmermann’s reading these standard dualisms support another that is the central thesis of the book—that Kant accepted a ‘hybrid theory of practical failure. . .which points to a hybrid theory of practical rationality’ (6, 7). Is failure to conform to reason due to mistaken judgment about, or ignorance of, the good due to cognitive failure (as Socrates thought)? Or is it due to a conscious failure to act on one’s judgment about what is best, due to some sensible influence, in which case the failure is ethical (as Aristotle thought in opposition to his teacher)? Timmermann terms the first account ‘intellectualist’ and the second ‘volitional’. His striking thesis is that ‘Kant is committed to intellectualism about non-moral action while defending a strongly anti-intellectualist or volitional position in the realm of moral choice’ (6–7). In non-moral or prudential choice, either an agent’s failure to take the available means to a professed end is due to ignorance or mistaken judgment about the appropriate means; or it is due to the agent’s no longer wanting the end, or not wanting it enough to bear the costs of attaining it. Neither case is an instance of what is termed ‘true irrationality’, because one’s choice does not in fact diverge from one’s judgment of what is prudentially best. Practical failure in this domain is due to mistaken judgement, rather than choice that violates some distinctively practical principle. But, Timmermann argues, this account of practical failure does not ring true in the moral sphere. ‘Moral failure is not caused by some cognitive defect or a flawed piece of reasoning. It consists in the conscious, knowing, voluntary choice not to will the moral end’ (7). In prototypically moral failure we judge one action to be the morally good choice, but knowingly choose a different course (weakly, inexplicably, perversely, etc.).

Timmermann ascribes these differing accounts of practical failure to Kant on both textual and philosophical grounds, and his discussion of practical failure is a bridge to the hybrid account of practical rationality, which holds that choice is determined in radically different ways in the moral and non-moral domains. In prudential choice Kant is an intellectualist in the sense that choice and action are invariably determined by one’s judgment (e.g., of what one wants most, or of the proper means to one’s end). There is no gap between judgment and choice, and we do not knowingly choose contrary to our judgment. However, in the moral sphere rational deliberation and judgment are one thing, but choice is something further and choice can diverge from judgment. The faculty of choice is tasked with following the dictates of practical reason. But given the heterogeneity of the incentives by which human beings are moved, following the dictates of practical reason requires an elective act on the part of an agent that reflects or determines one’s character. In that sense, Kant is a ‘volitionist’ about moral choice.

The upshot, according to Timmermann, is that there is no unified account of practical rationality in Kant. One element of this dualistic reading is his claim that for Kant ‘there is no freedom in non-moral choice’ (4n.14)—a claim to which I will return.

Some background will help bring out the significance of Timmermann’s reading. The above dualisms are on display in the Analytic of the Critique of Practical Reason, where Kant draws a distinction between ‘practical laws’ deriving from the formal principle of morality based in reason a priori and ‘material practical principles’ that place the ground of choice in pleasure or the feeling of agreeableness (KpV 5: 22ff.). In the Critique Kant treats this dichotomy as exhaustive, in that any principle of choice falls into one category or the other. Moreover, what unifies those in the second category (‘makes them wholly of the same kind’) is that they place the ground of choice in pleasure or the feeling of agreeableness—which Kant treats as affections ‘of one and the same vital force’—so that any principle of choice other than respect for moral principles—including, e.g., other-regarding principles based on affection or natural sympathy— falls under the ‘general principle of self-love or one’s own happiness’ (KpV 5:22). And in Chapter II, Kant argues that absent an a priori law of pure practical reason, the only ground of choice is the subjective standard of what an agent finds agreeable.

Several commentators have looked for ways to soften these dichotomies and to find some continuity between moral and non-moral choice—often on purely interpretive grounds, but sometimes in an effort to nudge Kant in a direction that they find philosophically more acceptable. They grant the heterogeneity of moral and non-moral incentives and allow that they ground different deliberative processes. But they argue that Kant held (should have held?) that as different as these incentives are, they are taken up into choice on the same terms—through an act of reflective endorsement, or by taking the incentive to be an objectively sufficient ground of choice. The idea—and here is a variation of what Henry Allison has called Kant’s ‘Incorporation Thesis’—is that any incentive comes to influence choice by being taken up into practical self-consciousness as an item from which one can reason to action. Timmermann cites Christine Korsgaard, Allison, Stephen Engstrom, and myself as proponents of what he calls ‘intellectualism’ about moral choice. (I’m happy to be included in this august company, and though I prefer the term ‘cognitivism’, I will use ‘intellectualism’ in this review in deference to Timmermann.) Some readers find continuity between moral and non-moral choice to be inherently attractive, but in addition this approach has the specific advantage of allowing Kant to say that choices made on both moral and non-moral grounds are free (and imputable to the agent) in just the same sense. A difficulty for this approach is that, in addition to holding that morally neutral or innocent choice results from a judgment made on sufficient grounds, it must say the same about choices that are clearly morally bad—that in action that violates moral principle, an incentive influences choice through the agent incorrectly taking it to be an objectively sufficient ground of choice.^[1] Does such a model allow for knowing and intentional wrong-doing, as Kant allows and which seems clearly possible? This concern is one of Timmermann’s reasons for defending an alternative approach that he finds truer to the texts.

Timmermann’s reading is striking for ascribing to Kant a hybrid theory of practical rationality—intellectualism about prudence and a volitional understanding of moral choice. Equally striking is his suggestion that the interpretive approach that he targets is the ‘mirror image’, favoring a volitional understanding of prudential and an intellectualist understanding of moral choice (128). One might think that one should have the same understanding of each domain, whatever that might be. Clearly there is still a lot to sort out here.

Timmermann’s book contains insightful discussions of many topics central to Kant’s conception of practical reason and to related contemporary discussions. The writing is admirably clear and to the point. There is much to be learned from his careful interpretive work and from his comments on the relevant secondary literature. I found almost all of the book to be instructive, even though I take the other side on several issues. Since his main claims deserve more detailed discussion than a short review permits, I’ll limit myself to pointing out some main building blocks of the hybrid conception that he ascribes to Kant.

Chapter 2 argues for the hedonistic reading of Kant’s conception of happiness as a sum of agreeable feeling (rather than overall desire satisfaction), stressing that for Kant the difficulty of forming a conception of happiness is uncertainty about what we will find agreeable. Timmermann emphasizes Kant’s idea that the quantity of expected pleasure is the single ‘volitional currency of prudential deliberation’ (27). This is an important element of the hybrid conception since it sets up the idea that human beings are moved by two heterogeneous kinds of interests (moral and prudential), between which there is, as it were, no rate of exchange.

Chapter 4 is a discussion of instrumental imperatives aimed at showing that so-called ‘“empirical practical reason” is not a mode of practical reason at all’ (46). On Timmermann’s reading ‘there is only one principle of practical reason: the categorical imperative (52).’ Noting Kant’s later view in the Critique of Judgment that hypothetical imperatives are ‘corollaries of theoretical reason (KU 5:172),’ Timmermann sides with those who argue that Kant did not accept a single fundamental principle of instrumental rationality that, following Tom Hill’s classic paper, is often called ‘the Hypothetical Imperative’. There are then no distinctively practical principles of means-end rationality—neither particular hypothetical imperatives understood as genuinely practical principles nor a single fundamental principle of instrumental rationality. This idea sets up one line of argument for intellectualism in the prudential domain. If there are no genuinely practical principles of instrumental reason, there is no ‘true means-end irrationality’ in the sense of action that violates some such principle. But if practical failure in the prudential domain is not due to the violation of some practical principle, then it must be due to ignorance of or failure to grasp the relevant (theoretical) means-end connection. That supports the idea that prudential choice is directly determined by judgment (about what will bring about most satisfaction, etc.). Timmermann develops a more intuitive line of argument as well. It is hard to understand why an agent would not take the known and available means to an end that she wants, especially if we assume that agreeable feeling is the single volitional currency in the prudential domain—indeed, so hard to understand that it could never happen (cf. 65). If one is not taking the available means to something that one wants on the grounds of expected pleasure, that must be due either a) to a mistaken judgment about the means or b) to the agent’s now finding some alternative more appealing (in which case there is no practical failure) (see 8, 57, 109).

One problem that I see is that Timmermann supports this point through very simple examples, such as taking steps to make good coffee or good bread. In cases where the means to a happiness-based end is clearly known and available, it is hard to understand how someone with the end can fail to take the means, and we conclude that they changed their mind about the end. Here the intellectualist account that draws a straight line between means-end judgment and choice is compelling. However, I do not see that such cases rule out the possibility of more complex cases of true means-end irrationality—where an agent fails to take the known, available but difficult steps to what she clearly believes will bring greater happiness, cases where volitional failure (out of weakness, distraction or indecision) is plausible. Philosophers are divided over this issue and though Timmermann’s discussion is carefully framed, I doubt that it will settle either the philosophical issue or what Kant thought.

Chapter 6 raises important challenges to the ‘intellectualist’ conceptions of moral choice mentioned above (namely that rational choice is constitutively guided by a judgment of sufficient reasons). First, it contains a valuable discussion of Allison’s ‘Incorporation Thesis’, arguing that this thesis does not clearly support ‘intellectualism’ about moral choice. Allison’s concern was to identify the element of spontaneity that is central to Kant’s conception of free choice across the board, and he does not explicitly position himself as supporting an ‘intellectualist’ conception of ‘incorporation’. (In fact, there is ambiguity in the notion of ‘incorporating an incentive into a maxim’. Is ‘incorporation’ a bare elective act, the simple adoption of a maxim? Or does it involve an element of normatively guided judgment or endorsement?) Timmermann’s contribution is to bring out the cognitivist slant to Allison’s reading (namely that to incorporate an incentive into a maxim is to endorse a general principle that treats the incentive as a sufficient ground of choice) and to show that another interpretation is possible, here getting into the weeds with alternate readings of passages from Kant’s Lectures on which Allison draws. The main thrust of Timmermann’s discussion is that ‘incorporation’ is an act of Willkür, of the faculty of choice. But on the standard reading of this distinction, while Wille is a deliberative capacity (it is ‘practical reason itself’ (MdS 6: 213)), Willkür is a purely elective capacity. As Timmermann writes, given that ‘rational assessment cannot be the task of Willkür. . .why not assume that incorporation is an elective, not an evaluative act? (97)’ Human beings are moved by heterogeneous and incommensurable motives, and we must choose which to prioritize. A second challenge is the difficulty for the ‘intellectualist’ of accommodating the phenomenon of knowingly acting against one’s moral judgement (102–6). Timmermann cites several passages in which Kant clearly allows for this possibility. The question for the ‘intellectualist’ here is how to accommodate these passages and, more importantly, this phenomenon.

Can the ‘intellectualist’ respond to these clearly legitimate challenges? I think that there is textual support for the ‘intellectualist’ position, though granted there are texts that run in the other direction. One might not find a decisive answer in what Kant says.^[2] But there are systematic considerations as well. There is a general worry that the ‘volitional conception’ detaches moral choice from practical reasoning and judgment in ways that make it arbitrary and ungrounded. Should we attribute such a view to Kant? More generally, does an elective conception of choice fit into a general conception of the will as a rational power that is exercised according to its own constitutive principle? Is there room in that conception of the will for a purely elective capacity whose exercise, though subject to normative (moral) assessment, is itself normatively ungrounded? (Timmermann will certainly say ‘Yes,’ while I say: ‘Perhaps Not’.) These are complicated issues that need more discussion than this review permits. One virtue of Timmermann’s essay is to have raised them so clearly.

One recurring theme in the essay is that prudential choice is not free: ‘there is no freedom in empirically conditioned practical choice, which might just as well be mechanical, because the spontaneity involved is relative to antecedent purposes rather than absolute’ (98). (See also 4n14, 8, 24, 120, 156.) Initially these remarks puzzled me because they come close to saddling Kant with the ‘Reinhold problem’—that only morally good choice is free, that morally bad choice is not free and therefore not imputable. But Timmermann does not saddle Kant with this problem. Rather he is articulating the standard Kantian idea that free agency is only manifest or most fully realized in action motivated by respect for moral principle. But then does Timmermann’s reading leave room for a sense in which all choice across the board is free?

I understand his reading as follows: Genuine freedom requires the capacity to choose between radically different alternatives. That is, it requires both that agents face motivational alternatives of an entirely different kind and that they have the capacity to choose between them. Furthermore, freedom requires a capacity for genuine self-determination. Human beings satisfy these conditions. We are moved by incentives that operate in ‘different volitional currencies,’ and we have the capacity to choose between them. Furthermore, that capacity is a capacity for self-determination because it gives us the ability to set aside sensible interest and to act from principles that reason gives to itself. Human beings then have the capacity for free agency. Where only prudential considerations rooted in the expectation of agreeable feeling are at issue, we can move almost ‘mechanically’ from such considerations to choice; in that respect prudential choice does not draw on our free/moral capacity. But since moral considerations are always on the table, in any choice situation where we find reason to, we can bracket prudential interest and follow moral principle. (So the existence of free/moral capacity settles the issue of responsibility.)

I suspect that there is another piece to this puzzle. One might think that, given the ever-presence of morality, whenever agents act from prudence, they have elected to—that is, they did in fact side with that basic alternative. That is to say that they have exercised a capacity for elective choice that does not draw on specifically moral capacity (but which could at any time). Is that a sense in which all choice across the board is free? These are delicate issues that Timmermann might address more explicitly.

Kant’s Will at the Crossroad develops a comprehensive approach to Kant’s conception of practical rationality supported by careful reading of the principal texts. By re-affirming several (familiar) dualisms that other commentators have played down, it lays out an alternative to one influential trend in recent Kant scholarship. These issues are subtle and complex, and we should be grateful to Jens Timmermann for putting them on the table so clearly and giving us the opportunity to think them through once more.