Wojciech Kaftanski’s book is a wide-ranging treatment of Søren Kierkegaard’s unremitting engagement with the topic of mimesis, not only in the latter’s early aesthetic musings, or in his trenchant observations on the dynamics of social levelling, but also in the philosophical anthropology woven throughout the Dane’s reflections on art, religion, and human existence. Kaftanski traces the theme of mimesis through signed and pseudonymous works, as well as Kierkegaard’s journals and notebooks. Initially, Kaftanski’s work on mimesis calls to mind Charles Bellinger’s The Genealogy of Violence (2001), but the two texts are different in scope. While Bellinger sets out to link (a) Girard’s persuasive account of the origin of violence in the proliferation and intensification of mimetic desire to (b) Kierkegaard’s belief in a universal anxiety that triggers the search for societal legitimation, Kaftanski has a more capacious view of mimesis as intrinsic to all learning—“mimesis is a human condition underpinning the individual and social aspects of human existence” (239). While Kaftanski in no way minimizes (Kierkegaard’s concern with) the stifling effects of comparison and conformity on individual and social existence, he nonetheless underlines, as Aristotle would, the mimetic element in any pursuit of a good life. When this more expansive view of mimesis is brought to bear on Kierkegaard’s authorship, a number of interesting questions arise concerning the positive and negative forms of mimesis and what criteria, if any, may be brought to bear in distinguishing between them. The issue that Kaftanski sees as central, however, is how Kierkegaard’s overriding concern in the second authorship with the imitation of Christ is to be understood—how, more particularly, this call-to-imitation stands in relation to Kierkegaard’s critique of the crowd behavior that embodies the depersonalizing effects of mimetic desire. It would indeed be remarkable if the influence of the Corsair affair, which forcefully brought home to Kierkegaard the increasing power of the “public” and the distinctly modern forces that shape it, were to be limited in the religious/theological sphere to a preoccupation with martyrdom and sacrifice. Kaftanski’s analysis taps into a deeper motif joining Kierkegaard’s cultural reflections to his theology. He challenges the assumption that the writings concerned with the imitation of Christ will fit neatly into what he calls the imitatio Christi tradition. His reading of Kierkegaard on this question shows Kaftanski at his probing best. He offers a renewed sense of the depth of Kierkegaard’s debt to Romantic aesthetics, even as he underlines Kierkegaard’s ongoing determination to bind Romantic tropes to the classic, or Kaftanski might say Platonic, insistence on a transcendent truth.[1]
Kaftanski’s text opens with an examination of German Enlightenment and early Romantic aesthetic treatises. He surveys the views of Baumgarten, Mendelssohn, Winckelmann, Lessing, Wackenroder, and Hegel on issues pertaining to (1) the limits of aesthetic representation and (2) the classical view of mimesis as representation vs. early German Romantic attempts to work out an on-the-face-of-it oxymoronic notion of mimetic originality. The upshot of this discussion casts doubt on Kierkegaard’s otherwise firm insistence on the opposition between the aesthetic and the religious. Kaftanski depicts Kierkegaard’s immediate cultural predecessors as deeply engaged in the recasting of the classical notion of mimesis. Soulless duplication and mimicry were shunned in favor of an ideal of mimesis which could generate the unique and originary and make manifest the spirit of the letter. And while Baumgarten and Winckelmann theorize an aesthetics concerned solely with the representation of the beautiful, the nineteenth century German revival of the notion of the sublime (with Moses Mendelssohn (1758) reviewing Edmund Burke’s (1757) treatise on the subject) opens the way for a much richer understanding of the range of aesthetic affect and its ability to reflect more fully our humanity. Kierkegaard’s grappling with the relation between art and religion is rooted in this rich soil and undermines the force of Assessor Wilhelm’s assertion in Either/Or II that art cannot adequately represent suffering” (E/O 2, 136, SKS 3, 135). Kaftanski’s careful work not only prepares the reader for an aesthetically informed interpretation of Kierkegaard’s religious communication, it also opens a pathway, as previously indicated, between mimesis as an aesthetic category and Kierkegaard’s call to imitation of Christ, with which the late writings culminate. The discussion of eighteenth- and early nineteenth-century aesthetics paves the way for Kaftanski’s claim that Kierkegaard’s references to Christ the Prototype (Forbillede) can only be fully understood in the philosophic context of their iteration. This comes clearly to the fore in Chapter Four of Kaftanski’s text, which he singles out as “the central part of this book” (11). Chapters Four and Five contain Kaftanski’s reading of “what is by far the most discussed aspect of mimesis by Kierkegaard scholars,” namely, Kierkegaard’s remarks on imitation (Efterfølgelse). Kaftanski argues, in a challenge to scholarly consensus, that “imitation” in the late authorship is not to be construed as exhibiting an exclusively theological core, deploying a sense of mimesis that upstages its philosophic roots, but rather that “Kierkegaard’s interests in imitation are deeply philosophical; hence they go beyond their religious/theological scope” (103–104). Let’s unpack Kaftanski’s elaboration of this claim.
Working from a pregnant passage in Kierkegaard’s posthumously published Armed Neutrality, Kaftanski argues for a distinction between “Christ the Prototype” and the “ideal picture (ideale Billede) of being a Christian” (155). In the cited passage, Kierkegaard maintains that Christ is represented in Holy Scriptures “more in being than in becoming, or actually. . .only in being” (Armed Neutrality SKS 16: 113, quoted by Kaftanski, 156). In contrast to the purportedly static nature of Christ as “the object of faith,” the “ideal picture of being a Christian” is understood by Kaftanski as open to change and appearing in manifold ways. The latter prototypes, he claims, are human productions which serve to mediate Christ’s essence in the world of becoming. While Kaftanski’s further gloss to the effect that Christ “is not a human as we are, hence, our imitation of Christ will not make us into Christians,” (157) may seem to stray into a heterodoxy unwarranted by Kierkegaard’s original, Kaftanski’s more fundamental claim does not, it would seem, necessitate flying in the face of the Council of Chalcedon. Just as Augustine rejoices in the fruitful multiplication of signs that gesture beyond themselves to qualities they themselves do not wholly embody, so, too, Kaftanski highlights the way in which the Kierkegaardian authorship is replete with multiple “prototypes” that may serve as teachers of Christian becoming, or more broadly of authentic human existence, by pointing beyond themselves. While Kaftanski does, it is true, depict Christ the Mediator as in need of mediation, Kaftanski’s aim is, I believe, to draw attention to features shared by “Christ the Prototype” and the multiple “mediators” offered by Kierkegaard and his pseudonyms (the aesthetically rich depictions of Abraham, Job, the woman who was a sinner, and, his “preeminent embodiment,” (220) the lilies and the birds[2]). Just as Christ’s exemplarity defies “direct” presentation because the God/Man’s nature is not subject to empirical confirmation, so, too, the lilies and birds cannot “directly” represent to human beings the qualities which Kierkegaard says they possess by nature (joyfulness, silence, and obedience) since human beings must, unlike the lilies and the birds, both imaginatively construct and choose the ideal in order to appropriate it. It is through this line of reasoning that Kaftanski opens his readers’ eyes to the complexity that he claims is exemplified, though in different ways, both by Christ as Prototype and by Kierkegaard’s prototypes for authentic existence, as both require imaginative creation and appropriation.
Kaftanski’s final chapters apply the fruits of this discussion to the development of a positive model of mimesis. He advocates for a practice of “indirect” mimesis, which avoids lifeless subjection to the ideological depictions of human “success” which have proved so powerful in modern culture. By drawing on recent work on affectivity, underlining the importance of the body, of emotion, and of the non-cognitive and often unconscious dimensions of human experience, Kaftanski underlines both the importance of and the dangers intrinsic to the mimetic underpinnings of cultural life.
A refreshing note of excitement animates Kaftanski’s account of the role of mimetic theory in Kierkegaard’s thought. Kaftanski sees in Kierkegaard a recognition of the way in which the development of our humanity and indeed our very individuality are dependent on mimetic forces, and he appropriately grounds Kierkegaard’s elaboration of this theme in the activity of his Romantic predecessors. Their awareness of the degree to which humans at once receive and create the path to ethical and religious development is of course qualified and altered by Kierkegaard’s insistence that the creative dimension of this process is itself an imitation of One who transcends it. Even here, however, precisely in Kierkegaard’s taking up of the age-old teaching to “follow Christ,” Kaftanski discerns Romanticism’s insistence on the creative task of the individual and the undeniably subjective element involved in the construal of both task and goal. Kaftanski’s central interest is in the lessons, and warnings, for modern life that can be cultivated through a discriminating awareness of the role of mimesis in human existence: “Kierkegaard’s reading of mimesis is pharmacological. He sees mimesis as both a problem and a cure for the maladies of the modern individual” (7).
If there is a shortcoming to Kaftanski’s reading of Kierkegaard through the lens of the mimetic, it lies in the way Kaftanski’s vision forces him to minimize Kierkegaard’s sober and very Lutheran reminders of the limits of our imagination and our willing. In Chapter Two, Kaftanski’s accounts of Repetition and The Crisis and the Crisis in the Life of an Actress are ethical in nature, i.e., they lean into the Kantian assumption of human autonomy, thus neglecting the religious sense of a repetition which must be received rather than actively constructed. Kaftanski passes over the fact that the young man in Repetition remains in all his striving but a poet, i.e., within human immanence, even if he has escaped Constantine’s designs, perhaps by becoming him. Similarly, the “crisis” in which the actress struggles to create love, to “play” Juliet, when the fiery originality of youth is past, is not necessarily resolved by the “conscious, continual and non-habitual recommitment to our ends” that Kaftanski recommends (66). Reviving and taking seriously this apophatic dimension of Kierkegaard would complement Kaftanski’s emphasis on the rich plethora of Kierkegaardian prototypes of authentic and specifically Christian existence. It would bring to awareness the way in which the mimetic representations that proliferate so wildly in Kierkegaard’s texts do so precisely because they fail. They cannot provide decisive guidance on how to make what Kierkegaard believes to be the transcendent goal of human life concrete. Kaftanski’s accomplishment, however, and it is one to be celebrated, lies in his insistence on the degree to which Kierkegaard’s production of literary exemplars for human life is part and parcel of a tapestry that unites aesthetic, ethical, and religious dimensions of human existence, one without which Kierkegaard’s constant return to apophatic self-denial would itself be but a lifeless repetition.
REFERENCES
Charles Bellinger, The Genealogy of Violence: Reflections on Creation, Freedom, and Evil, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2001.
Joel Rasmussen, Between Irony and Witness: Kierkegaard’s Poetics of Faith, Hope, and Love New York: Continuum, 2006.
Edmund Burke, A Philosophic Inquiry into the Origin of our Idea of the Sublime and the Beautiful, London: 1757.
Moses Mendelssohn, “Philosophische Untersuchung des Ursprungs unserer Ideen vom Erhabenen und Schönen,” Bibliothek der schönen Wissenschaften 3, no. 2 (1758): 290–320, repr. in Rezensionsartikel, 216–36.
Frances Maughan-Brown, The Lily’s Tongue: Figure and Authority in Kierkegaard’s Lily Discourses, Albany: State University of New York Press, 2019.