Alexander Bird argues (amongst other things) for two overarching theses: that (1) knowledge acquisition is the goal of science, and that (2) empiricism should be rejected. He contrasts the position that he advocates for—that knowledge is the aim of science—with other positions that take it to be truth, or understanding, or problem-solving power, or the like. And by empiricism, he specifically means empiricism that is grounded in sense-perception.
The prose is clean, and structurally the book is easy to follow throughout. This reader found herself mentally dividing the content of the book into two sections. The first portion, chapters 1 through 6, sets down the foundations for the answers to these two big questions. Bird argues that there is a single main function to science—conceived of as a necessarily social inquiry—and that its function, understood in the old-fashioned teleological way, is to acquire knowledge. And whatever grounds our knowledge—the evidence we have (sometimes observational, though not necessarily always) is anything that allows us to make knowledge-acquiring inferences. Chapter 2 walks the reader carefully through an argument by analogy between knowledge and belief; Chapter 3 is a thorough discussion of what scientific progress is, considering other alternatives such as increases in problem-solving ability, in truth, and in understanding. Chapter 4 is a long consideration of science as a social endeavor, and in particular works out what the social-individual relationship is. Chapter 5 tackles what evidence is, giving a functionalist answer here as well and making what was to me an unexpected connection to an epistemological thesis due to Timothy Williamson (the evidence is knowledge thesis). Chapter 6 builds further on the notion of evidence by offering a characterization of observational evidence—and hedges by cautioning that not all evidence is observational (and certainly very little of it is, as Bird says, perceptual, particularly in the sense-data sort of way).
The second part of the book, Chapters 7 through 9, discusses philosophical implications for these foundational remarks, addressing in particular abduction, probability, and the realism-anti-realism debate. This part of the book which I have carved out walks through: inference patterns that Bird takes to end in knowledge (the answer, by the way, is inference to the only explanation, as opposed to the best explanation—Chapter 7), the right interpretation of Bayesianism that would be compatible with inference to the best explanation (which we still might have to use sometimes in less than ideal scenarios) (Chapter 8), and the status of sweeping meta-scientific claims such as global realism and anti-realism (Chapter 9).
In this project that brings together analytic epistemology with philosophy of science, Bird avails himself of a number of argumentative strategies from both. For example, Chapter 4’s argument that the distributed model of social cognition—social structures have cognitive functions where individuals may have different functional roles to play—is buttressed, among other things, by a thought experiment about the emperor’s new clothes, an example that supports the thesis that everyone knows that p, but there is a lack of social knowledge (75). But Bird is also cognizant of the need to make his argument by appealing heavily to scientific history and practice, avoiding the charge of armchair theorizing. In fact, Bird does so right away in this book: Chapter 1 begins by pumping intuitions by considering real cases like meteorology that involve data automation and processing as central parts of inquiry, where the implication is that perception does not seem to play a huge role in what counts as evidence. Other examples are peppered throughout the text and range widely—in addition to examples I had been familiar with (Röntgen’s X-rays, Semmelweis’s investigation of puerperal fever, the Royal Society and its Philosophical Transactions), there were a number I was less familiar with—Van ’t Hoff’s investigation of carbon bonds, the Alvarez meteor hypothesis (and its contenders) for the K-Pg extinction, and even a reference to the medieval Oresme’s inquiry as to why hot goat’s blood could split diamonds—the last one being tongue in cheek.
While the first portion of the book was a careful consideration of main theses, it was the second section that struck me as more philosophically daring. I enjoyed, for instance, Bird’s discussion on inference to the best explanation (IBE) as well as inference to the only explanation (IOE) (Chapter 7). While we, Bird claims, fall back on IBE when we cannot have IOE, there are reasons to think that our picking what we consider to be lovelier explanations has heuristic value. What counts as lovelier than something else is based on a particular candidate’s similarity to exemplars from history and practice—and we have some reason to think that something’s being lovely is a good indication (though not sufficient for) being on the right track. And in an interesting connection to Bayesianism, using such heuristics is to assess what Bird calls the plausibilities (as opposed to probabilities, though not totally unrelated) of hypotheses (Chapter 8).
The overall picture, which leans towards epistemological externalism, is an elegant one, and it is truly impressive how many moving parts Bird manages to tie together. But I have a worry here about the generalizability of these ideas, or at least when we move away from Bird’s chosen stock of examples. For example, in many models in macroeconomics, we find that economists often stipulate a representative agent figure that stands in for all agents that occupy the economy. (On the other hand, I do acknowledge that some newer strategies incorporate heterogeneous agents.) It’s opaque to me what counts as lovely, even by current disciplinary standards (and Bird is careful to point out that what counts as lovely may change over time). And even if something could be called lovely—a representative agent makes a model that makes things much simpler, if anything—it does not follow that it is tracking the truth. But perhaps this says more about economics than anything else.
One risk of Bird’s argumentative strategy, I think, is that sometimes Bird relies on intuitions that sometimes I do not find intuitive. I am not sure I have strong intuitions about the Nipper of the Yard (127) thought experiment, for example, as to whether something does or does not count as a defeater for someone’s claim to a bit of perceptual knowledge. And sometimes the themes of the book fit so seamlessly together that it masks the messiness of science, even though Bird is careful to acknowledge that, too. For one, knowledge does not obviously seem to me propositional—something that Bird takes for granted. And it is often the case that where to get from one point to another would, if fully spelled out, be less rigorous and structured than one would like. Sometimes Bird makes it sound as if that’s what we would want, ideally(e.g., note the characterization of faultless inference procedures on 113). Other times, he recognizes that we simply aren’t ideal epistemic subjects and yet manage to acquire knowledge; “failure to remember should not be regarded as a wrinkle, a departure from the ideal depicted by the theory” (125). And in general Bird is not committed to the ideal of the perfectly rational scientists—“to maintain probabilistic coherence at all costs leads to the species of irrationality characteristic of the conspiracy theorist” (215).
Sometimes, in science, things get so messy that it’s not clear how we should think of it. The construction of, and the making of inferences from, economic models or theories is not always rigorous even in the straightforward sense. Science is chock-full of instances where we begin with what’s-not-quite-true, managed by some variety of both formally acceptable and sometimes ad hoc procedures, in order to get some product, which itself may not be entirely obviously true either. And I don’t mean a little bit messy—I mean a lot messy. Here is an example that is a bit further afield from Bird’s primary examples, again from economics—Boumans (2001), in an investigation of Irving Fisher’s attempts to construct the ideal index number. Fisher tried to find a general-purpose formula to construct aggregate measures like price indices, but eventually found himself to be negotiating between a number of desirable but incompatible features. In particular, not all the axioms that he would have liked to satisfy, could be so consistently satisfied. But Fisher suggested that while we could not achieve the theoretically ideal index number, we could instead design index numbers that satisfy the desired criteria enough to be practically useful. And I think that this messiness is something that Bird could have embraced even more openly. One place where we get this sort of feeling is indeed, in his suggestion that sometimes hypotheses can gain plausibility from something other than being conditionalized on evidence (220). And despite what I said previously, even his account of what makes for a “lovelier potential explanation” (205)—we tend to think some explanation is lovelier than another the more it looks like particular exemplars that we already accept—is a proposal that is sensitive to our real psychology and sociology of science and scientific communities. I also cannot emphasize how pleased I am to see the concluding chapter of the book cast a side-eye to broad philosophical proclamations on the matter of realism versus anti-realism.
While I think Bird overstates how tied the position of empiricism is to sense-experience simpliciter, overall there is much I am sympathetic to in this book; in fact, I am sympathetic to most of it. What we find is a very generous, and I think fairly intuitive, conception of what counts as science; and a very generous, and fairly intuitive, account of what counts as evidence. The book also does double duty as a handy reference manual to what sorts of debates are out there in epistemology of science, and is an extremely useful entryway to Bird’s own thinking, integrating together his previous work that stretches back into at least the last two decades. I, for one, was especially fascinated by the kinds of connections to be made at the intersection of epistemology and philosophy of science, connections that Bird lays out so well. That is probably the book’s greatest virtue.
REFERENCE
Boumans, M. (2001). Fisher's instrumental approach to index numbers. History of Political Economy, 33(5), 313–344.