Luis Villoro (1922–2014) is a central figure in Mexican philosophy and is read across the Spanish-speaking world. Guillermo Hurtado’s excellent anthology of Villoro’s work provides a comprehensive view of Villoro’s key ideas and marks a major contribution to contemporary epistemology. The anthology reflects the work of a cosmopolitan intellectual, trained at the National Autonomous University of Mexico, who also held postgraduate fellowships in Paris and Munich. Organized thematically in four sections, it includes articles, brief pieces of commentary, and excerpts from books, all in Spanish. The first section, on “the other and others”, focuses on religious and existential experiences, the sacred, and indigenous identity in Mexico. Section two, on knowledge, rationality, and truth, is dedicated to Villoro’s epistemology. In section three, on power and ideas, we find Villoro’s views on political philosophy, and finally, in section four—on community, democracy, and justice—we encounter Villoro’s account of the plural state and his proposal for a negative route to justice (or via negativa), which can be interpreted as a non-ideal approach to ethics. The theme that I will focus on is Villoro’s social epistemology, which underlies many of the contributions in the anthology.
Delineating the bounds of reason is a central task of philosophy. Immanuel Kant argued that this task is foundational to all possible investigations about truth and justification, and many philosophers today follow him in this engagement. Reasoning is a practice that includes scientific explanation, moral development, and aesthetic judgment. Reasoning shapes our political and legal institutions and is, therefore, the basis for a fair society. The way in which our capacities for reasoning should be guided concerns the limits of reason—not all reasoning is adequate. Villoro considered this foundational question deeply across his impressive and prolific oeuvre. Kantians address the question of how we ought to reason through an examination of the fundamental conditions for rationality in each realm of thought and for any given thinker. Villoro, by contrast, focuses on the question of what reason is for: the fragile nature of our capacities to provide reasons in a fluid and politically warped realm of action. One of his main contributions is a theoretically rigorous and politically enriched approach to social epistemology. It is timely for contemporary philosophy, which is currently pivoting toward exploring political and ethical commitments.
As the title of the book indicates, Villoro was deeply interested in the disruptive nature of justified reasoning, a position that reflected his engagement in politics throughout his life and manifested in his decision to become a Zapatista.[1]Knowledge should guide us in our fight against oppression and ideology, and this social function of knowledge cannot possibly be reduced to mere academic speculation. Knowledge leads to concrete actions. Otherwise, one cannot fully explain the relation between knowledge and freedom. The ethical dimension of this relation entails a personal commitment to the rational disruption of various forms of oppression and epistemic injustice. Reason-guidance must make possible the integration of knowledge, participative democracy, and liberation, from ideology, manipulation, and violence. In fact, Villoro argues that when reasoning prevents this integration, such reasoning should be considered either manipulative or mere abstract play—not genuine knowledge.
Transformative and liberational reasoning radically differs from what Villoro calls “unreasonable” rationality. An essential part of the task of delineating the proper bounds of reason is to draw and examine this distinction. Much of our reasoning goes towards maintaining the status quo and to manipulating one another. Genuine knowledge transforms and disrupts these unreasonable practices not for the sake of spreading chaos, but for the purpose of enriching and further liberating humanity. The philosopher of science Thomas Kuhn described the very essence of scientific reasoning as disruptive. The Hegelian and Marxist traditions define the progress of rationality as essentially disruptive. But Villoro’s perspective on this matter is unique. We are neither progressing steadily towards eternal peace nor towards absolute truth. To find the truth, one must engage intersubjectively with as many perspectives as possible, both to guarantee that others are not excluded, and because we lack an ultimate exemplar of justice, peace, or truth. We therefore need a negative route to justice. We start not with an ideal portrayal of justice, but with the crude realities of exclusion and discrimination, of poverty and oppression. The elimination of these realities is the path to justice.
How could knowledge lead towards disruptive justice? Readers may be familiar with an example of disruptive knowledge in Frederick Douglass’s remarkable 4th of July address. The self-evident truth of human dignity enshrined in the United States’s Constitution, he showed, had been maintained in unison with the grotesque immorality of slavery. The legal system that upheld slavery was based on rational, yet unreasonable commitments, and disrupting it was an epistemic and moral duty. As Douglass said, what is needed is not lessons from doctors or senators, but “the storm, the whirlwind, and the earthquake.” Truth must not only be abstractly conceived. It must be socially achieved and practiced every day. Reasonable rationality, for Villoro, demands this practice.[2]
Villoro reminds us that when modern science moves away from its philosophical and social foundations it dehumanizes knowledge and eliminates personal concerns. This was also the claim of Edmund Husserl (180), whose thoughts on epistemology Villoro examined in a book-length study. Knowledge, according to Villoro, is not an end in itself: it responds to our need to make the world more meaningful, and it also makes our actions more efficient and inclusive of others (181). His interpretation of Husserl through this pragmatic principle leads him to claim that radical science, as opposed to naïve science, is always wise. Wisdom does not depend, like the specialized sciences, on anything else for its justification. Wisdom is foundational, it concerns the philosophical foundations of science, and it unites knowledge with liberation.
The Renaissance is, for Villoro, a paradigmatic example of disruptive reason, grounded in epistemic and ethical commitments. Villoro says that it provided a delineation or “figure” of the world—a way of conceiving our position in the natural and social order, which we must renew and expand (295). It increased our geographic and cosmological horizons, and it created new and basic sentiments about what it is to be human (296), thereby generating the need for new political ideals. This disruption transformed philosophy and maintained a dynamic force in our understanding of reality that still fuels our investigations. The foundations of science have undergone several disruptions since then. However, Villoro warns us that our science has become dehumanized, and that the promise of liberation through knowledge remains unfulfilled. A non-militarized and ethically brave scientific community is needed to secure this. The Renaissance’s focus on the arts and humanities as guides towards inquiry should be renewed as part of this effort. Unveiling the truth and expanding the boundaries of freedom through knowledge requires a new science, one that is not an alien appendage to the daily realities of most humans. The exclusion of most people from the production of knowledge should be a matter of great epistemic and moral concern.
Knowledge is a socially produced, collective achievement. The Renaissance doesn’t belong exclusively to Leonardo or to Galileo, yet their personal commitments, and those of others who joined them, made the Renaissance possible. Genuine knowledge liberates, and it is always courageous. Responsible reasoning applies not only to beliefs, but also to actions and behaviors oriented towards specific social goals (209). Reasonable rationality is transformative and disruptive. It has a basing character. And it also has profound political implications. Villoro is not, therefore, a radical communitarian, since personal commitment can never be replaced by social conditioning or design.
But it is fair to say that reasonable rationality produces collective transformative experiences. Individual transformative experiences count for very little in this context. They become relevant only when reasonable rationality is firmly in place. The house of reason is not a monolithic temple. Various epistemic cultures, the dominant and the oppressed, struggle to shape a dynamic and politically infused space of reasons and actions. A theory of rationality is incomplete without a clear distinction between reasonable and unreasonable reason-giving in such a dynamic context. The highest forms of rationality, our greatest epistemic achievements, require the highest degree of integration between epistemic inquiry and moral, as well as aesthetic, reasoning. This normative requirement makes Villoro, in my opinion, one of the most original and encompassing social epistemologists and theorists of rationality.
Villoro, like many contemporary epistemologists, offers an account of the norms of belief and rationality. These norms are guides for concrete action by a socially embedded agent with a personal grip on reason. Villoro is emphatic about this. He begins his analysis of the ethics of belief by clarifying that belief and knowledge have an essential practical function that is best understood as a guide for action, uniting epistemology with ethics (153). I cannot examine here the details of how Villoro defends his norms of belief, and will instead just focus on how these are really norms of integration between the epistemic and the ethical domain. A few aspects of his normative account are worth emphasis. Villoro distinguishes between two forms of the verb, “to know.” Saber requires intersubjectively achieved, objectively sufficient justification, while conocer requires successful action and reliability. Interestingly, wisdom is one of the highest forms of conocer, while science is a form of saber.
A unique feature of Villoro’s norms of belief is that they are postulated as social rights and duties. This is why intersubjectivity, more than “truth”, plays an essential role in his epistemology. These norms concern: i) the duty to pursue the highest degree of justification, in accordance with the practices of specific epistemic communities, and the right to communicate one’s reasons for adopting beliefs and acting in a certain way (a right against testimonial injustice and epistemic silencing); ii) the duty to achieve and maintain epistemic autonomy while respecting the autonomy of others, and the right not to be manipulated or oppressed; and iii) the duty that one’s actions must be consistent with one’s beliefs, and the right to be considered as coherent by others.
The aim of these norms is the integration of ethically robust epistemic communities. They concern not just individual belief, but collective belief and crucially, action. For Villoro, solipsistic rules for the guidance of subjective belief contradict the essence of the ethics of belief. He says that the ethical validity of these norms depends on the prevalence of the general interests of the epistemic community above individual ones, and that these norms do not guide belief in isolation, but only in the context of situations for actions that lead to their formation (175). Villoro argues that these norms help us avoid dogmatism and skepticism, which are forms of epistemic intolerance. Ultimately, the goal of following these norms is to use our reasoning and knowledge for the purpose of liberation (182).
Anglophone philosophers would benefit from a translation of this anthology, for it offers important insights. The conditions for disruptive rationality and reasonableness require much more than subjective belief. Reasonableness requires personal and constant alertness and attention to the needs of others, and a constant commitment to intersubjectively achieved truth and justice.[3] This is the importance of the scope of the norms of reasoning, which necessarily include actions and dispositions to change our world, in which injustice, epistemic and moral, prevails.
ACKNOWLEDGMENTS
I would like to thank Guillermo Hurtado for his helpful comments.
REFERENCES
Montemayor, Carlos (2023). Luis Villoro y el principio de no exclusión. Diánoia: Revista de Filosofía, 68(90): 31–51.
Srinivasan, Amia (2020). Radical Externalism. The Philosophical Review, 129(3): 395–431.
[1] The Zapatista Army of National Liberation is frequently referred to as “Zapatistas”, named after the agrarian revolutionary Emiliano Zapata. Their aim has been to defend the rights of indigenous peoples against violence by the state. The insurgency began in 1994 and Villoro became involved soon thereafter.