“What are fundamental laws of nature?” was the question that brought me into philosophy. As a physics student, I was trained to analyze and apply physical laws, perhaps even search for new and better ones. But I had never paused to ponder: What are these “things” that we are testing, analyzing, looking for. . .? What does it mean to be a fundamental law of nature?
Eddy Keming Chen’s excellent book Laws of Physics provides a concise, state-of-the-art exploration of this rich and fascinating philosophical question. An exemplary realization of what I understand the Cambridge Elements series to be about, the book is a great introduction for advanced students, a valuable resource for lecturers, and a relevant and inspiring read for experts.
In roughly 80 pages, Chen lays out the debate on the metaphysics of laws with many of its facets and implications, presents the most important contemporary accounts, addresses the epistemology of laws, and even touches on some very recent developments in the field. Yet, thanks to the precise and well-structured presentation, the discussion never feels too cramped, rushed, or simplistic. Naturally, the short format limits both the breadth and depth at which all these issues can be explored, but the references point interested readers to an excellent selection of modern literature, including notable works by other young scholars of Chen’s generation. What one won’t find in Laws of Physics is a discussion of the long (intellectual) history of the concept; the book dives right into the contemporary debate.
Chen’s answer to the question “What are fundamental laws of nature?” is an account called Minimal Primitivism (MinP), first introduced in a 2022 article co-authored with the mathematical physicist Sheldon Goldstein. In MinP, “fundamental laws are regarded as fundamental facts of the universe,” and they “govern by constraining the physical possibilities of the entire spacetime and its contents.”
In contrast to Tim Maudlin’s primitivism, according to which laws govern by producing later states of the world from earlier ones, MinP is neither committed to a fundamental direction of time nor to exclusively dynamical laws. It is thus more flexible and able to accommodate various types of candidate laws that physicists have been considering, such as laws constraining the boundary conditions of the universe (which, in turn, play an important role in many reductive programs with respect to the arrow of time). The book provides several examples of such candidate laws that are hard to square with other non-Humean accounts. This includes different versions of the “Past Hypothesis,” imposing low-entropy conditions at one temporal boundary of the universe, and the time-symmetric Wheeler-Feynman theory of electromagnetism, which involves both retarded and advanced relativistic interactions. One might consider some of these highly speculative, but Chen makes the compelling case that a philosophical account should not dismiss such candidate laws a priori as metaphysically impossible. Other parts of the book go even further in challenging preconceived notions of what fundamental laws of nature could be—a hallmark of Chen’s remarkable work in this field—but I am going to return to the basic ideas of Minimal Primitivism.
As the term “primitivism” suggests, the account demands that we resist the temptation of asking how or in virtue of whatfundamental laws constrain physical possibilities. “On MinP, laws govern by constraining, and constraining is what they do. This provides the oomph behind scientific explanations” (24). Readers who consider it a core task of metaphysics to analyze, if not deflate, modal concepts will hardly be satisfied. In my view, any account of natural laws will have to start somewhere, and “constraining physical possibilities” is as good a primitive as any—and better than most. On the one hand, I agree with Chen and other primitivists that any talk about causation, counterfactuals, dispositions, etc., is much more transparently analyzed in terms of physical laws and their modal structure than vice versa. On the other hand, I believe that the paradigm of how fundamental microscopic laws explain phenomena is to be found in Boltzmannian statistical mechanics rather than Newtonian initial value problems. In view of the contingency of any initial microstate (and our very limited epistemic access to them), it is really the whole set of possible micro-histories—consistent with relevant macroscopic boundary conditions—that grounds explanations by making certain regularities typical. I have defended this view in my own 2003 book on typicality reasoning, and it fits particularly well with a constraining account of fundamental laws.
There are other aspects of MinP where I see a need for further elaboration. I wonder, for example, how much to make of the claim that fundamental laws are fundamental facts of the universe. Is it to suggest that “facts” are the right ontological category to sort fundamental laws into and that the crucial issue of “simplicity of laws” should be parsed in terms of the simplicity versus complexity of facts? Chen’s fundamental epistemic principle, according to which simplicity is an epistemic guide to lawhood, suggests that the commitment is to fundamental facts about lawhood, i.e., about what the laws of our world are, rather than to laws themselves being unanalyzable modal facts. But I don’t want to start splitting metaphysical hairs.
What is clear is that, according to MinP, a law is not fully characterized by the class of models, i.e., possible worlds, that it determines by constraining. An infinitely long list of possible histories of the world is not supposed to be nomically equivalent to simple mathematical equations that determine the same class of models as their solutions. Chen admits that is “an interesting and open question, on MinP. . .how to understand the equivalence of laws” (23). This is fair enough, but it seems to underplay the issue a little bit. Isn’t there a sense in which we don’t really know what physical laws are as long as we don’t know their identity or equivalence conditions? The question of nomic equivalence is certainly the right one, but I suspect that a satisfying answer will require sacrificing some of the account’s minimalism to provide a finer analysis of the “structure” of laws and how they relate to mathematical representations. Alternatively, one could bite the bullet, take a page out of the best-systems playbook, and say that fundamental nomic facts are merely primitive facts about what worlds are physically possible, while fundamental laws are the optimal summary of these modal facts—not just of our actual mosaic but of the whole landscape of possible ones.
While much of the book can be read as a defense of Minimal Primitivism, MinP is also skillfully employed as a didactic tool to introduce and contrast the most important competing accounts: Humean reductionism, which regards laws as merely descriptive; Platonic reductionism, based on necessary connections among universals; Aristotelian reductionism that grounds laws in dispositional properties; Marc Lange’s approach of reducing laws to counterfactuals; and Maudlin’s primitivism, where laws govern by dynamically producing the history of the world. Of these alternatives, the most space is justifiably dedicated to the Humean Best System Account (BSA), which has essentially become the standard against which “non-Humean” alternatives are measured. Several challenges to the BSA are discussed throughout the book; they are not necessarily new, but they are all still relevant. The most significant new challenge arises from MinP itself, which presents as an attractive competitor that rivals the BSA in terms of flexibility and parsimony. In practical terms, the BSA maintains an advantage regarding irreducibly probabilistic laws, which it naturally integrates via the Humean regularity theory of chance. Conversely, it is not obvious how probabilistic laws constrain physical possibilities and, thus, how they fit into Minimal Primitivism. While the book articulates these issues very clearly, it directs readers to recent research for detailed discussions of possible solutions.
Despite the brevity of the book, I have only been able to touch on a fraction of the interesting ideas and arguments it discusses. Laws of Physics is an outstanding synthesis of an introductory textbook and an original contribution to the philosophical debate about the fundamental laws of nature. I can recommend it to anyone interested in the topic.