In the philosophy of logic, the traditional view is monism—the idea that there is a single, univocal, everywhere-correct formal logic that captures, in some sense, logical validity in natural language. This view has been challenged by an increasing number of philosophers of logic, in an increasingly complex literature, involving innumerable variants on non-monist views. Erik Stei’s Logical Pluralism and Logical Consequence challenges this trend, defending logical monism against the rising pluralist tide.
Since this review will focus to a certain extent on aspects of Stei’s account with which I disagree, it is worth beginning with an explicit bit of praise: Logical Pluralism and Logical Consequence is excellent. Stei meticulously and charitably lays out extant arguments for logical pluralism, provides a novel, detailed, and extremely helpful framework for understanding the connections between distinct versions of pluralism, and formulates precise and careful arguments against the variants of logical pluralism found in the literature. Regardless of whether one ultimately agrees with Stei, the reader will almost certainly better understand the issues at issue in the literature on logical pluralism after reading this book.
While logical pluralists have taken great pains to describe and develop their challenges to logical orthodoxy in detail, rarely do they attend as carefully to what, exactly, the default logical monist position amounts. Stei takes (the correct understanding of) logical monism to be the conjunction of the following two claims:
(1) That there is exactly one notion of extra-systematic logical consequence.
(2) That there is exactly one logical theory that provides the best account of this notion.
(204)
Stei’s goal in Logical Pluralism and Logical Consequence involves both a positive and a negative aspect. The negative aspect involves refuting (or at least throwing significant and substantial doubt upon) the wide variety of pluralist views in the philosophical literature. The positive aspect involves defending logical monism as characterized by claims (1) and (2) above.
Stei begins (Chapter 1: “Logical Pluralism Introduced”) with a brief survey of the lay of the logical land, and a summary of the work undertaken in the chapters to follow (a similar, but more detailed summary is provided in Chapter 9 “Closing Remarks”). He then begins developing the framework within which his arguments and critiques will be formulated in Chapter 2 (“What Does It Mean for a Logic to be Correct?”), which focuses on defending two ideas.
The first of these is the idea that, when evaluating logics in terms of correctness, there are three distinct things we might mean by “logic”: logics as mathematical objects (13—16), logics as interpreted logical theories (16—21), or logics as the subject matter of those (interpreted) theories (21—27). Stei argues convincingly that the only interesting and non-trivial understanding of logical pluralism is the third option.
The second idea is that the subject matter of logic (and hence the target phenomenon of logical pluralism) is an extra-systematic logical consequence relation in natural language, and hence a formal logic is correct in virtue of whether, and how, it captures (in the relevant sense) logical consequence (27—36). In short, logical pluralism is concerned with formal logics understood as theories of (or models of, or other representations of) extra-systematic natural language consequence.
Chapter 3 (“Three Dimensions of Plurality”) outlines three distinct dimensions along which one might argue for a plurality of correct formal logics: One might be a logical pluralist in virtue of an underlying pluralism regarding the domain(s) of application (applicational logical pluralism, see 38—41), or one might be a pluralist in virtue of an underlying pluralism regarding the meaning(s) of the logical constants (semantic logical pluralism, 41—45), or one might be a pluralist in virtue of an underlying pluralism about the extra-systematic natural language consequence relation(s) (metaphysical logical pluralism, 45—50).
Before moving on, we should note that there is a potential fourth dimension that might be invoked in developing logical pluralism. In Cook (2023) I provide a taxonomy similar to Stei’s, but which includes an additional option: perspectival logical pluralism. Simply put, one might be a pluralist in virtue of an underlying plurality of types of reasoners:
different groups of reasoners might inhabit different epistemological perspectives, where different logics correctly codify the consequence relation in or from these different perspectives. (Cook 2023, 185)
Of course, we can’t blame Stei too much for failing to include a variant of logical pluralism that was not published when Logical Pluralism and Logical Consequence went to press. Nevertheless, any genuinely complete account of the underlying roots of logical pluralism will need to go beyond Stei’s tripartite classification.
In Chapter 4 (“The Cardinality of Consequence”), Stei focuses on metaphysical logical pluralism. After briefly discussing instrumentalism (there is no coherent notion of correctness at all, 53—55) and nihilism (really two views: there is a viable notion of correctness, but either (a) no logic is, in fact, correct, or (b) the correct logic is the empty logic, 55—58), he argues that extant formulations of pluralism seem compatible with monism regarding the extra-systematic consequence relation (58—67). He then provides an argument—which we shall call the simple argument—that monism regarding the extra-systematic consequence relation implies logical monism:
So consider the claim that the logics endorsed by the pluralist are, in fact, equally good models of the same subject, namely of logical consequence. Here is a simple argument against this claim. Suppose L1 and L2 are both theories of logical consequence that meet the conditions (i) and (ii) above. Suppose, for the sake of argument, that extra-systematic logical consequence is constituted by natural language arguments that preserve truth. Given condition (ii), one of the logics, say L1, licenses at least one argument Δ that L2 does not. Now, if Δ in fact preserves truth, then L1 seems to provide a better model than L2. After all, it constitutes a truth-preserving argument not captured by the other logic. In contrast, if Δ does not preserve truth, then this seems to rule out L1. A logical theory that licenses arguments leading from designated premises to an undesignated conclusion does not even meet the minimal conditions for a good model of logical consequence. (72—73)
Importantly, Stei does not take the simple argument to be a deductively valid refutation of logical pluralism, but rather something like an argument to the best explanation. He notes the following shortly before giving the argument reproduced above:
I argue in the remainder of this chapter that, on the assumption that monism about extra-systematic consequence is correct, monism about logical theories is also the most plausible view. (72, emphasis in original, see also 80)
Stei’s measured assessment of the simple argument is appropriate. This argument does present a serious challenge to the logical pluralist who takes classical logic to be one of the (everywhere correct) logics. In fact, the simple argument appears to be a deductively valid refutation of logical pluralism when viewed from such a perspective. But, viewed from other perspectives, things are not so simple.
Consider a logical pluralist who thinks that there is more than one logic that best captures the (singular) extra-systematic logical consequence relation, but who also believes that all such logics are sub-logics of intuitionistic logic (this example is adapted from Cook 2014). For our imagined pluralist, meta-theoretical arguments regarding the coherence of logical pluralism should not presuppose logical principles that are not licensed by any of the logics they take to be correct. Such a pluralist can put pressure on the simple argument above at a number of places.
First, condition (ii), mentioned in the quotation above, reads as follows:
The logics are incompatible—that is, they validate different inferences. (72)
Our imagined pluralist, however, need not accept the following (rather strong) version of condition (ii), which we will call strong disagreement:
SD: There are correct logics L1 and L2, and argument Δ, such that Δ is licensed by L1 and not licensed by L2.
Instead, they could express their commitment to (a version of) condition (ii) via acceptance of something like the following (intuitonistically much weaker) claim, which we call weak disagreement:
WD: It is not the case, for any correct logics L1 and L2, and argument Δ, that Δ is licensed by L1 if and only if Δis licensed by L2.
Second, Stei’s argument involves an instance of constructive dilemma, which is not valid in the logics taken to be correct by our imagined (intuitionistically-inclined) pluralist.
As a result, the simple argument fails to get off the ground in this case, since our imagined pluralist is free to either reject SD as the proper understanding of condition (ii), or reject the legitimacy of constructive dilemma when reasoning about the correctness of a logic, or both.
Stei briefly considers something like this point, and writes:
Why should the existence of two equally good theories thwart our efforts to build a better theory? Exactly this would need to be established, however, in order to establish revisionary logical pluralism and to thereby rule out at least the cautious version of monism mentioned above. Be that as it may, these considerations are mostly hypothetical since logical pluralists typically do endorse classical logic and some non-classical logics. (77, emphasis added)
But, as he observes in a footnote, the considerations in question are not completely hypothetical:
One exception is Cook (2014, 256), who considers a version of logical pluralism that endorses intuitionistic logic and continuum-many intermediate logics. This sort of pluralism relies on controversial epistemic or metaphysical assumptions that come with Dummettian anti-realism, however [. . .] (77, footnote 11)
While Stei may be right that the version of pluralism formulated in Cook (2014) relies on controversial assumptions (by his lights), the worry is somewhat more general. Although most versions of logical pluralism retain classical logic as one of the correct logics, this is a contingent, historical fact, not a conceptual feature of logical pluralism itself. There is no requirement (even on Stei’s analysis) that logical pluralism involves an endorsement of classical logic. Thus, a pluralist might accept multiple relevant logics as correct without endorsing classical logic, or multiple n-valued (n > 2) logics as correct without endorsing classical logic, and so on. The defender of any such view can resist the simple argument, since the degree to which this argument should worry the logical pluralist will co-vary with the reliability the logical pluralist ascribes to the (classical) principles mobilized therein.
Moving on. Chapter 5 and 6 (“Domain Dependence” and “Pluralities of Meanings”) then present arguments against applicational (or domain-specific) logical pluralism and against semantic logical pluralism, respectively. Chapter 5 criticizes three kinds of argument that have been mobilized in favor of domain-specific logical pluralism of the sort defended in Shapiro (2014)—arguments based on mathematical practice (81–87), arguments based on alethic pluralism (87–92) and arguments against the universal applicability of logic(s) (93–105)—with substantial further discussion of logical instrumentalism and logical nihilism thrown in. Chapter 6 (“Pluralities of Meaning”) then addresses semantic logical pluralism, demonstrating that the kinds of ambiguity, context-sensitivity, polysemy, or vagueness mobilized in defenses of meaning-variance versions of logical pluralism saddle the defenders of such views with implausible accounts of the meanings of logical constants.
Chapters 7 (“Plurality and Disagreement”) and 8 (“Normativity and Collapse”) consider two distinct interpretations of the (supposed) existence of multiple correct logics. First, in Chapter 7, Stei explores the idea that these are rival, competing, yet equally correct codifications of logical consequence. He considers three versions of the rivalry thesis, distinguished in terms of whether the rivalry involves a disagreement at the semantic, metasemantic, or applicational level (152). He argues that the first two options are untenable, since disagreement at the semantic or metasemantic level undermines one or more of the central commitments of logical pluralism (e.g., entailing that distinct, correct logics codify distinct concepts Valid1 and Valid2, see 174—178). Put simply, according to Stei, there is an inherent tension between any attribution of genuine disagreement between distinct logics and the thesis that each such logic is correct.
Chapter 8 (“Normativity and Collapse”) then addresses the collapse argument against logical pluralism. This argument (versions of which appear in Williamson 1988, Priest 2001, Read 2006, and elsewhere) involves the idea that logic has some normative force with respect to belief. Stei’s preferred formulation of the relevant normative constraint is the following wide-scope ought principle with negative polarity:
wo-: If A1,…An ⊢ B, then for all subjects σ: σ ought to see to it that σ does not accept all sentences in A1,…An and reject B.
Here is a quick version of the collapse argument: Assume that logical pluralism is true. Then there are two distinct logics L1 and L2 such that both L1 and L2 are correct. Thus, there must be at least one set of sentences Δ and sentences Φ such that the argument from Δ to Φ is valid in L1, but invalid in L2 (or vice versa). Imagine, further, that we believe the sentences in Δ. Thus, via wo-, L1 prohibits us from rejecting Φ, while L2 remains silent on whether Φ should or should not be rejected. But this means that we in fact have a reason for not rejecting Φ. Since L1 encodes this reason (given our acceptance of Δ), and L2 does not, L1 is, contrary to our assumption, a better logic than L2.
Stei’s discussion here is particularly valuable, since it constitutes by far the most detailed examination and assessment of the collapse argument in the literature. In particular, Stei works through a number of more sophisticated versions of the argument, eventually formulating a version that avoids vexed questions about whether logic is inherently normative, and if so, exactly to what the normativity of logic amounts. The finer details of Stei’s ultimate formulation of the collapse argument are beyond the scope of this review, but we can note that it involves replacing controversial principles such as wo- (and logic-centric norms like it) with general, and seemingly uncontroversial, norms directly governing knowledge and belief—norms that are independent of any special role we accord (or not) to logic (or logics). The precise and powerful version of the collapse argument given here is certain to be a thorn in the side of most accounts of logical pluralism for some time.
A thorn for most accounts, but not quite for all. Versions of logical pluralism that fail to endorse classical logic (or sufficiently strong sub-classical logics) will be more resistant (if not immune) to the collapse argument, since (once again) they need not accept that the proper way to understand disagreement between logics is SD, rather than WD (or some other formulation classically equivalent to SD, but weaker than SD in their favored logics). The collapse argument, like the simple argument discussed earlier, fails to get off the ground if we understand disagreement in terms of WD and we restrict ourselves to appropriate sub-classical logics. Thus, as before, there is still room to maneuver here.
We should not make too much of the worries sketched above, however, as they in no way diminish the genuine accomplishment that is Stei’s book. Prior to Logical Pluralism and Logical Consequence, the literature on pluralism was a hodge-podge of different versions of the logical pluralist idea, and the differences and similarities between these different views were unclear at best (despite similar, albeit less ambitious attempts at systematization such as Cook (2010) and Russell (2019). Stei’s book is invaluable in that it provides a detailed classification of, and map of connections between, all of these different views, showing what exactly they entail, and where they are most philosophically vulnerable. Further, his defense of logical monism—especially in Chapters 7 and 8—amounts to the first detailed, book-length description and defense of logical monism in the literature. Regardless of whether the reader agrees, in the end, that Stei has successfully refuted logical pluralism (and logical nihilism), and defended his preferred version of logical monism from all comers, there is no doubt that any reader of this text will come away with a much more nuanced understanding of the terms and terrain of the logical nihilism/ monism/ pluralism debate.
REFERENCES:
Cook, R. (2010), “Let a Thousand Flowers Bloom: A Tour of Logical Pluralism”, Philosophy Compass 5/6: 492–502.
Cook, R. (2014), “Should Anti-realists Be Anti-realists About Anti-realism?”, Erkenntnis 79: 233–258.
Cook, R. (2023), “Perspective Logical Pluralism”, Res Philosophica 100(2): 171–202.
Priest, G. (2001), “Logic: One or Many”, in J. Woods & B. Brown (eds.), Logical Consequence: Rival Approaches, Proceedings of the 1990 Conference of the Society of Exact Philosophy, Stanmore: Hermes, 23–28.
Read, S. (2006), “Monism: The One True Logic”, in D. DeVidi & T. Kenyon (eds.), A Logical Approach to Philosophy: Essays in Honor of Graham Solomon, Dordrecht: Springer, 193–209.
Russell, G. (2019), “Logical Pluralism”, Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy, online at: https://plato.stanford.edu/entries/logical-pluralism/
Shapiro (2014), Varieties of Logic, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Williamson, T. (1988), “Equivocation and Existence”, Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society 88: 109–127.