Many scholars working on democracy today draw our attention only to its upsides or its downsides—the dream or the nightmare. But Alexander Guerrero’s Lottocracy: Democracy without Elections is an admirable exception. While he recognizes that the positive and negative potentials of democracy are intimately related, he gives us reason to hope that we can avoid the worst. His analysis unfolds in two parts. The first part diagnoses the failures of electoral democracy, and the second defends an alternative in which randomly selected citizens are empowered to make political decisions. As he envisions it, such a system would be composed of 20 ‘single-issue lottery-selected legislatures’ (SILLs)—hence the name ‘lottocracy’. Each of these bodies would comprise 450 members set to deliberate about and decide on policies for their respective issue domains, such as health care, trade, education, etc. He also envisions the establishment of executive assemblies to carry out policy, as well as structural assemblies to ensure coherence and facilitate coordination among the SILLs.
Although these proposals will strike some as radical, even skeptical readers will find much of interest in Guerrero’s diagnosis of the failures of electoral democracy. He insightfully catalogues its flaws and shows how hard it would be to address them satisfactorily; even so, his contention that the failures are endemic has been notably criticized by Landa and Pevnick (2025). Readers will also find much of interest in the elaboration of his lottocratic proposals. Here, he succeeds in his aim of showing that lottocratic institutions are feasible and promising without getting bogged down in canvassing the contingent obstacles to their implementation. Guerrero works out the details of his proposal with great care and circumspection, displaying an admirable balance of idealism and realism.
Of even greater interest, to my mind, is Guerrero’s original approach to institutional evaluation. The argumentative strategy of the book is to compare the merits of electoral and non-electoral institutions on the basis of a functional standard of success, combined with the deployment of other normative standards of political morality, such as rights and equality. I will focus my remarks on Guerrero’s account of institutional success because it is so philosophically rich in its own terms and also because it is crucial for establishing his core conclusions.
Political Functionalism and Institutional Capacities
First, in order to avoid stacking the deck (or seeming to) against electoral institutions, Guerrero develops and defends a standard for assessing governmental institutions that he calls political functionalism. It is a welcome departure from the tired dichotomies that otherwise characterize democratic theory—liberty vs. equality, procedure vs. outcomes, procedure vs. substance. Instead, Guerrero argues that institutions should be evaluated holistically based on how well they enable citizens to solve practical problems of moral significance that arise from the “human political condition” (35). These include the promotion of “wellbeing, individual autonomy, social equality, and justice”, as well as the protection of “certain moral rights of individuals and communities” (30). However, defining a function around such general aims proves difficult. It must also accommodate the variety and complexity of problems that communities might face.
Therefore, Guerrero adopts a form of political contextualism, according to which we should never conclude that an institution will be effective for a given society without first taking into account certain facts about that society, including factors such as its education level and the degree of “racial, cultural, linguistic, socioeconomic, and religious diversity” it exhibits (38). While Guerrero thinks that claims about the merits of political systems can be fully objective and evaluator-independent, he stresses that they are conditional and “contextually relative” (40).
How, then, can the virtues of lottocracy be shown while upholding both political functionalism and political contextualism? Guerrero’s solution is to shift the focus to institutional capacities. He thinks that since all institutions will need certain basic capacities in order to function, institutions can be evaluated on the basis of having these capacities. But whenever capacities are used as a basis of evaluation, a whole host of theoretical problems arise. The first concerns how we are to think of multi-element or multi-dimensional capacities. At one point, for instance, Guerrero says the capacities include weighing evidence “accurately and appropriately” (42). Assuming these two goals are distinct, can or should they be jointly maximized, and at what cost to other capacities?
A second challenge concerns how we are to factor in resource scarcity. In the case of an individual agent, it is important to develop a sense of when the time has come to stop deliberating and act. But whenever agency is distributed and institutionalized, how can we say in general what amount and format of deliberation will manifest the capacities conducive to effective action?
A third challenge appears when we consider time horizons. A group of novices may find it preferable to adopt a structure in which the development of their capacities is slower but more resilient because they utilize the learning process to improve their judgment. In such cases, the capacity to expand one’s capacities is also, technically, a capacity. Not enough is said to address these sorts of challenges.
Nor is it clear how shifting the focus to capacities permits us to make comparisons that are sufficiently sensitive to context. On the one hand, when Guerrero urges a genuine respect for complexity and contextualism, he seems to accept a commitment to endogenous specifications of functionalities. But once we have that kind of genuine contextualism, it’s very difficult to know from the outside how to compare. If, for example, we were to look at two different societies’ ways of balancing liberty and rights, we would not be in a position to compare the pair in terms of capacities for effective functioning instructively, as long as effective functioning is defined in terms of solving a unique set of moral-political problems in a given society. But the whole point of the project is to make a meaningful comparison between types of institutions. So there has to be some context-independence in the standard of success. But the more committed we become to one definite construal of capacities, the less contextualist we will be. Whereas shifting the focus to capacities had promised to be an escape from the challenges of context and complexity, in the end it seems to give rise to its own set of problems.
To my mind, these shortcomings limit the applicability of Guerrero’s approach to evaluating institutions. The adoption of political functionalism had promised to make comparative assessments of institutional forms tractable, but once it is combined with political contextualism, it seems that we are no better off. It also leads to an awkward rhetorical tone in which the author urges us to reserve judgment on almost everything because of the twin issues of complexity and context, even while displaying confidence in the overall capacity of lottocracy to address these very issues.
The Deployment of Other Normative Concepts
In addition to his advocacy of political functionalism as a standard for institutional assessment, Guerrero presents a suite of other normative concepts by which institutions can also be judged, such as equality and responsiveness. Here, Guerrero adopts a method we may call “strategic disambiguation”. First, he gathers up a more or less comprehensive list of things he expects readers to care about in political morality, such as justice, rights, equality, autonomy, etc., with the aim of showing that on each dimension, lottocratic institutions would perform no worse, and may in fact perform better, than electoral ones do. Taking them one by one, he disambiguates each concept into its possible plausible formulations. For example, when it comes to ‘political equality’, Guerrero spells out 10 possible things we could mean. Then he argues that some of the disambiguated formulations of equality can be eliminated because they would make the normative concept unattractive or infeasible, and, among the ones remaining, lottocracy fares well enough (315-324).
Such a strategy allows Guerrero to defend lottocracy while minimizing the need to commit to any particular concept of political equality. This ecumenically non-committal strategy has the virtue of not alienating a reader who happens to have a different conception of equality than the author does. But it also seems oddly coincidental that the only viable conceptions of equality, in this exercise, turn out to be the ones that fit with lottocracy. The reader feels as if they are being sold a new jacket on the grounds that, among all the possible settings in which they would wear it, the only ones where it wouldn’t be suitable are places that they wouldn’t want to go anyway. Just a coincidence?
Two instances of this exercise in strategic disambiguation left me particularly dissatisfied. One occurred during the discussion of responsiveness and accountability, which was otherwise quite insightful (334-344). Here, Guerrero points out that what it means for a decision maker to be morally accountable is different from what it means for them to be politically accountable. The latter normative concept, he thinks, once it has been fully isolated from the former, is not all that valuable. And, he thinks, while moral accountability is valuable, once it has been fully disentangled from notions of political accountability, the value of moral accountability is every bit as realizable under lottocratic institutions as under electoral ones. His prising apart of the moral and political dimensions of accountability, however useful on its own, makes it harder to appreciate the value of their combination. Often political accountability can foster moral accountability, and this is part of why we value it.
Another instance in which the strategic disambiguation exercise proves unsatisfying is Guerrero’s discussion of participation. Guerrero admits that it might seem that lottocratic institutions offer citizens fewer outlets to get involved in issues that move them, thereby neglecting a core democratic value. His response is to pose the philosophical question: what is valuable in the first place about an individual’s ability to participate in politics? Assuming that it is about having a say, he points out that the lifetime odds of serving a turn in a lottocratic institution (roughly 12%) is an opportunity that is more meaningful than the vanishingly small odds of influencing an electoral outcome (326-329). On the other hand, if it is about political advocacy, he says, then the opportunities under lottocratic institutions are more or less equivalent to things as they now stand. By the end of the exercise, Guerrero has factored out the elements of participation in such a way that whatever makes them valuable is addressed just as well by lottocratic institutions as by electoral ones. Again, one may ask: just a coincidence?
It’s useful for Guerrero to separate out and zoom in on these aspects of participation, but the segmentation of conceptual space makes it harder to see the big picture. People’s desire to participate—to ‘have a say’ in the decisions that affect them—is not necessarily about shaping policy in any determinate way. Sometimes, folks just want a ready outlet to express their dissatisfaction. Casting a vote for a certain party or candidate can be a way of registering discontent, but such ‘protest votes’ can also affect the development of a party platform. Voting affords both opportunities at once. If electoral participation opportunities can be good in multiple ways, their value may amount to more than the sum of their parts by virtue of their convergence.
It's even more evident that something gets lost in such segmentation exercises when Guerrero considers political participation on the part of groups organized to counter other groups with whom they disagree. Here, his segmentation strategy focuses on why we find group conflict concerning. He separates out three possible answers (330-332). First, if the disagreement is substantive and reasonable, he argues, it is more likely to get the public reckoning it deserves in a SILL than in an election. If it is not, then, secondly, the concern is about how to get political losers to accept their losses. There, he figures, the acceptance of loss in an electoral system depends to a large degree on the perceived fairness of the system. And such a perception of fairness, for him, is just as available for lottocracy as for elections. A third possibility would be cases of ‘us versus them’, i.e., pure group conflict. Then, he reasons, the grounds for optimism are thin across the board—across all the institutional options.
Again, Guerrero’s strategy of separating things out presupposes that each element of his segmentation can be analyzed conclusively when taken on its own. But what if their combination is equally important? In some cases, such as protection of minority languages, a group’s perception of being overlooked is related to the objective fact of their being overlooked, so it matters that the resolution is both fair and accepted as such. Furthermore, as can be seen with trade union strikes, sometimes the clash is both a pure group conflict and a substantive and reasonable disagreement. The opposition of propertied and propertyless classes is a perennial source of factionalization in politics, as James Madison observed. Although political dynamics can unnecessarily amplify the perception, the interests of the two classes are genuinely opposed. Assessing the adequacy of a solution to one aspect of the problem, i.e., the perception, is not independent of the adequacy of the solution to the other aspect, i.e., the real opposition of interests. Guerrero’s strategy of segmentation misses this important point.
Now, no analysis can capture everything, but there is a pattern that emerges from seeing what has been left out. Guerrero’s framework, to my mind, rests on a picture of governance according to which political competition (including bargaining) simply is not part of what makes institutions effective at problem solving. Why accept this picture?
As John Stuart Mill observed, the incorporation of healthy antagonism among those making the decisions can improve the quality of governance. The thought is that the competition for power, the rivalries, and even the tribalism can actually have a positive role in functional terms. Mill argues accordingly that Parliament should be organized so as to enable members to form a locus of organized opposition. There should be a pont d’appui, as he calls it: a focal point for the opposition to find its footing, a place from which it can push back against prevailing views. For Mill, a deliberative body can avoid the slow drift towards “collective mediocrity” only when there is a backstop against groupthink provided by those members who are incentivized simply to obstruct. His point is that only by accepting some unproductive friction can an institution reap the benefits of productive friction.
A lottocratic system, however, is designed to banish this sort of healthy antagonism. The whole point is to limit decision-making to certain deliberative contexts that are shielded from power differences, echoing Habermas’s dream of realizing a Herrschaft-free deliberative sphere. The practice of legislative bargaining, for example, seems to be eschewed as a method of policy-making (despite briefly acknowledging the practice of ‘logrolling’, in which certain bills are bundled with others in order to seal a negotiated compromise between opposing factions). Lottocratic institutions also shield deliberative bodies from the dynamics of political competition that operate in the wider society.
Under lottocracy, there is no obvious outlet for mass movements of reform. Those who are animated by the energies of opposition, resistance, and revolution lack an organizational structure through which they might have their reform aims articulated and pursued effectively. In some circumstances, the stability and cohesion of the society can be jeopardized by the lack of an outlet for mass movements. A leaderless democracy is not a ship that can be redirected; it cannot have a new course set for it by way of a groundswell. The possibility of schism is the first and most important problem to be solved in politics. For someone so concerned with the function of problem solving, Guerrero seems surprisingly unconcerned with political stability as such.
Perhaps Guerrero’s defense of lottocracy is intended to rest on a wholesale rejection of the potential for political competition to enhance institutional performance. If the rejection of this potential is not wholesale, however, and if it is admitted that it may have potential benefits, then shouldn’t these benefits be put into the balance with other factors when arguing for the superiority of lottocracy? Ideally, a new approach to institutional evaluation would give us a way not only to weigh and balance but also to integrate and reconcile the different normative standards that are relevant. Whatever the merits of Guerrero’s ecumenical and multi-factorial approach to institutional evaluation, allowing us to make an all-things-considered rating of the merit of an institutional form is not one of them.
This point echoes earlier concerns about adopting a methodology that seeks to honor complexity in all its forms. A defense of lottocracy in comparative terms would not be intelligible unless we had a legitimate basis for the comparison. Guerrero’s argumentative strategy, however, is to say that while things are mind-bogglingly complicated in certain respects, they are simplifiable enough to hold that lottocracy is defensible with respect to every consideration that might matter for political morality, at least in the circumstances we are familiar with today. To my mind, lottocracy can be defended with a strategy that emphasizes simplicity, or a strategy that emphasizes complexity, but not both at the same time. Guerrero’s mixture, along with the ecumenical deployment of normative standards like equality, makes the whole amount to less than the sum of its individually impressive parts. Guerrero’s project seeks to do justice to the complexity of institutional evaluation, but the particular simplifications and streamlinings seem to be a product of his pre-existing commitment to lottocratic empowerment as the best mode of governing.
In the end, what may explain Guerrero’s loyalty to lottocratic rule is not a hard-nosed political functionalism but a latent ethics of power. At one point, he observes that a member of a minority group may feel obligated as an elected representative to give special consideration to the effects of a political decision on their fellow group members. But under lottocracy, Guerrero says, no one is required to exercise power in this way nor even be tempted to feel that they should (336-337).
The idea seems to be that under lottocratic institutions, no one empowered to rule owes their empowerment to anyone else, so they are free to do what seems best. He illustrates this with a plane crash thought experiment, in which the small number of unhurt victims are suddenly thrown into a position of guardianship, responsible for exercising judgment on behalf of the larger group of stranded survivors (170). These remarks suggest that Guerrero is as interested in the ethical basis of empowerment as he is in its functional consequences. Be that as it may, Guerrero is right to remind us that lottocracy has a privileged relationship to an egalitarian ethos of empowerment. As Plato observed in the Laws, whenever lottery-based empowerment is instituted as legitimate, that is because it is recognized by a particular community as a way of imperfectly ratifying their positive commitment to political equality, not because it uniquely corresponds to moral or natural equality (690e, 757e).
The timing of Guerrero’s intervention is superb, as devotees of the democratic ideal have lost the moral high ground in recent years. The defenders of democracy are on the back foot, now being forced to play as much defense as they used to play offense. Guerrero’s sympathetic critique of democracy is therefore most welcome, even if what the book has to say about democracy’s moral foundations is not entirely new. Entirely innovative, however, are the theoretical interventions made by Guerrero when it comes to assessing institutions across a wide variety of political contexts. Along the way, he capably develops and defends a standard of legitimacy not wedded to democracy, a standard of institutional reform that is anchored in sensible functioning rather than in public justification or accountability, and a way of thinking about the protection of minority groups that recognizes difference without promoting tribalism. Although the overall analysis has its shortcomings, anyone interested in political theory will find this original and stimulating book richly rewarding.
REFERENCES
Landa, Dimitri, and Ryan Pevnick. 2025. “Should We Be Lottocrats?” Free & Equal: A Journal of Ethics and Public Affairs 1(2).
Plato. Laws. Translated by C.D.C. Reeve. 2022. Hackett Publishing Company.