Mary Shepherd: A Guide

It is notable that Deborah Boyle’s guide to Mary Shepherd’s work appears as part of the Oxford Guides to Philosophy—a series that aims to present concise and accessible introductions to “the most important primary texts in the history of philosophy” (ii). Even a decade ago, close to no philosophers or historians of philosophy would have recognized Shepherd’s name.^[1] Over the past several years, however, the situation has changed drastically. Prominent experts studying early modern and modern thinkers now see Shepherd as vital to our histories of ideas. Many others now regularly teach her works in undergraduate and graduate classrooms. And the secondary literature is expanding rapidly.

Last year marked the two hundredth anniversary of the publication of Shepherd’s Essay upon the Relation of Cause and Effect, a work that offers a trenchant response to Hume’s theory of causation and defends a novel alternative view. At this exciting moment in Shepherd studies, and with so many reading Shepherd’s books in pedagogical and scholarly contexts for the first time, Boyle gives us exactly what we need: an inviting, thoughtful, and wide-ranging examination of Shepherd’s corpus. The text does not aim to resolve interpretive debates. Instead, it offers a careful and instructive reading of Shepherd’s writings. Though more critical engagement with recent analyses of Shepherd’s philosophy would have been welcome, Boyle does include annotated reading suggestions at the end of each chapter, and her nearly constant focus on primary texts gives the book staying power. Indeed, for those interested in learning more about Shepherd, Boyle’s Guide is and will remain for years to come essential reading—perhaps the essential secondary reading in Shepherd studies.

Shepherd was a philosophical essay writer, with traditional questions in metaphysics and epistemology at the heart of her system. Still, like many early modern and modern women writers, her works do not fit easily into existing narratives. Shepherd hardly mentions Kant, taking as her main interlocuters Hume and Berkeley, thinkers who had been dead for about 50 and 70 years respectively by the time Shepherd was publishing. Given this, scholars tend to treat Shepherd as a late example of an early modern philosopher, with many abstracting from questions about Shepherd’s specific intellectual environment in order to connect her work with various twentieth and twenty-first century philosophical positions. Boyle does connect Shepherd’s ideas to more recent discussions, e.g., suggesting that Shepherd’s conceiving of the definitions of objects as necessary a posteriori truths anticipates Kripke’s argument in Naming and Necessity; or that Shepherd’s criticism of Hume’s view of miracles anticipates one developed by C. S. Lewis in Miracles: A Preliminary Study.^[2] But she also aims to read, and have her readers read, Shepherd in context—to understand Shepherd’s philosophy in its own intellectual setting.

Early in the text the reader is given a sweeping tour of intellectual currents that directly shaped Shepherd’s ideas, from Scotland’s “common sense” philosophy to early nineteenth century French theories in the tradition of Condillac. In her exploration of Shepherd’s response to Hume, Boyle considers how Shepherd extended the response to address the arguments of Scottish philosopher Thomas Brown in the aftermath of a dispute that played out in Shepherd’s day in the Edinburgh newspapers, about the viability of Hume’s theory. Later, Boyle capably reconstructs a series of relatively unknown debates that unfolded in London in the early nineteenth century amongst scientists, physicians and philosophers, such as surgeons William Lawrence and John Abernethy, historical background that deepens our knowledge of who Shepherd was reading and why she was concerned to work out the consequences of her theory of causation for, for instance, the nature of life and sentience.

We see evidence of Boyle’s talent for unearthing obscure but relevant primary sources throughout the footnotes of this book. Could there have been a second printing of Shepherd’s 1827 Essays on the Perception of an External Universe? What did Coleridge think of Shepherd? How does Shepherd’s correspondence with Babbage help us understand her views about induction? Which editions of various texts would Shepherd have had access to, and where was she learning about Kant’s philosophy? In a particularly delightful footnote, Boyle uses the private correspondence of one of Shepherd’s contemporaries, novelist Amelia Opie, to reveal that Shepherd and Brown met in person at a party in 1814, and that, despite Brown’s reluctance (he “d[id] not like literary women”), the two engaged in vigorous debate for multiple hours in front of other guests. Shepherd, we learn from Opie, was “as luminous, as deep, as clever. . .as any professor could have been.” (Brightwell, 1854, 153; quoted on Boyle, 2023, 82).

Following an introductory chapter, Boyle’s Guide proceeds systematically through Shepherd’s writings, beginning with several chapters devoted to unpacking in order each section of Shepherd’s first book. The following several chapters offer a thorough study of Shepherd’s other book-length essay, “An Essay on the Academical or Sceptical Philosophy”, again proceeding section by section through the original text. The latter essay was published with fourteen short essays prompted by “objections overlooked in the larger essays” (Shepherd 1827, 314). To help the reader navigate the range of topics tackled in the short essays, Boyle discusses some of them in the chapters dedicated to Shepherd’s second longer essay. Others are discussed in thematically organized groups, so that each of the last chapters of the Guide covers issues cutting across multiple shorter essays. Boyle also draws on the other writings we have of Shepherd’s—3 short papers, originally published in 1828 and 1832, and some letters, though these texts for the most part do not receive sustained discussion (an exception is Shepherd’s magazine article “On the Causes of Single and Erect Vision”, a focus of Boyle’s tenth chapter). Despite this ambitious near-comprehensiveness, Boyle delivers a unified and convincing reading of Shepherd’s system.

In part because of how closely it follows the order and structure of Shepherd’s own works, the guide is especially well-suited to being read alongside the primary texts. Boyle frequently notes for her reader which part of Shepherd’s oeuvre she is analyzing, and she includes a paragraph in the introduction outlining which parts of Shepherd’s works will be covered in which chapters of the guide. Still, a more conspicuous guide to the guide, if you will, would have been a valuable addition, especially because this book will be so useful for graduate and even advanced undergraduate learning and research. In any case, readers who have read the introduction and taken note of the paragraph containing an overview of the structure of the guide can fairly easily locate Boyle’s discussion of most sections of Shepherd’s writings.

Boyle shifts dynamically between her roles as explicator, advocate, and critic, skillfully elucidating especially opaque aspects of Shepherd’s philosophy along the way.^[3] Had I been Boyle, I might have more explicitly noted that, though synchronicity is a key feature of proximate causation on Shepherd’s view, Shepherd does regularly talk of distal causes that precede their effects, as when she writes of distal causes like tables or apples mixing with the mind to yield experiences.^[4] Or, in describing Shepherd’s argument for the continuous existence of mind-independent causes in chapter 6, I would have stressed the importance Shepherd places on patterns in phenomenal experience, and what those patterns imply about the nature of external causes. In discussing Shepherd’s view of causation of sensations, I would have wanted to make more of a case, on Shepherd’s behalf, that sensations cannot be caused by the mind “on its own”; nor simply by “neurological changes rather than by external objects”; nor by mere “processes in the brain and mind”; for changes in the mind or brain themselves require causes on Shepherd’s view.^[5] But my notes amount to differences in emphases, rather than substantive disagreements.

There are also places where I would have wanted Boyle to expand her study, to say more about, for example, a particular argument, or the impact of historical influences on Shepherd. However, Boyle has an aptitude for cultivating interest in the relevant primary texts, and this is just what a good guide should do. All of the book would be at home on a graduate-level syllabus (and I know it has already worked well on syllabi in graduate seminars at multiple major research universities); parts would even work well as assigned reading in an advanced undergraduate course (especially, perhaps, chapters 1, 2, 8, 9, and 10). While the text raises valuable questions and will lead to new debates, it also grounds an emerging field. It is an immense achievement so early in the evolution of Shepherd studies, one with effects that will be far-reaching (whether synchronous with their causes or not).

REFERENCES

Boyle, Deborah. Mary Shepherd: A Guide. Oxford University Press, 2023.

Boyle, Deborah. “Expanding the Canon of Scottish Philosophy: The Case for Adding Lady Mary Shepherd.” The Journal of Scottish Philosophy 15, no. 3 (2017): 275–93. https://www.euppublishing.com/doi/full/10.3366/jsp.2017.0173.

Brightwell, Cecelia Lucy. Memorials of the Life of Amelia Opie. Fletcher and Alexander, 1854.

Landy, David. “Shepherd on Meaning, Reference, and Perception.” Journal of Modern Philosophy 4, no. 12 (2022). https://doi.org/10.25894/jmp.1944.

LoLordo, Antonia. “Mary Shepherd on Causation, Induction, and Natural Kinds.” Philosophers’ Imprint 19, no. 52 (2019): 1–14. https://quod.lib.umich.edu/p/phimp/3521354.0019.052/1.

Shepherd, Mary. Essays on the Perception of an External Universe, and Other Subjects Connected with the Doctrine of Causation. John Hatchard and Son, 1827.