The problem of modality and specifically the truth of modal claims, the source of modal knowledge, and the metaphysical status of modal facts has engaged philosophers since the beginning of speculative reasoning. Modality has been deeply analysed from various theoretical perspectives. Each puts forth distinct philosophical assumptions about language, knowledge, and reality, along with the roles these assumptions play in revealing modal reality. One might naturally assume that the theoretical rigor with which problems of modality are approached today rests solely on the development and use of formal methods in contemporary philosophy. However, it is surprising to observe that many breakthroughs in the metaphysics of modality occurred long before the formal methods of analytic philosophy. These breakthroughs reveal that foundational insights into the nature of possibility and necessity were present in earlier philosophical traditions, demonstrating a deep historical continuity in the investigation of modality.
Modality: A History offers a rich and wide-ranging exploration of these deep problems surrounding modal phenomena. Although the book discusses modality primarily as a subject of philosophical interest, it also takes the reader beyond the borders of traditional philosophy, provoking reflection on philosophical problems from perspectives often considered external to philosophy proper, such as cosmology, religion or music. This makes the book valuable not only to philosophers but also to those with interdisciplinary interests.
The book consists of the editors’ introduction, nine regular chapters arranged chronologically, and five reflections that add depth to the analysis. The first chapter, ‘Aristotle on Modality’ by Marko Malink, outlines Aristotle’s theory of modalities as a study in its own right. Malink shows that modality plays a crucial role in Aristotle’s metaphysics, particularly in his logical works and his account of final causes. Moreover, Aristotle’s understanding of necessity and possibility figures prominently in reasoning about time, leading to significant investigations into fatalism. Malink’s chapter also delves into how Aristotle’s ideas were received by his students and further developed by the Megarics and the Stoics.
In the second chapter, ‘Modality in Medieval Latin Philosophy’, Simo Knuuttila guides the reader through the account of modal propositions in medieval philosophy. He places particular emphasis on the necessity of the present and the importance of temporality for understanding scientific facts. Drawing on the idea of diachronic modalities, Knuuttila explores the relationship between modality and temporality, particularly as it relates to an extensional framework for understanding the world. He concludes by discussing intentional modals and modal logic, offering insights into how medieval thinkers understood the overlap between language, thought, and modal truth. Knuuttila’s chapter illustrates that the medieval period was not merely a bridge between ancient and modern philosophy, but rather a rich era for investigating modality, especially in its reflections on the relationship between time and modality.
The third chapter, ‘Modality and Essence in Early Modern Philosophy: Descartes, Malebranche, and Locke’ by Anat Schechtman, provides an overview of how early modern philosophers like Descartes, Malebranche, and Locke formulated their views on modality. Schechtman elucidates the notion of ‘dependence’ in Descartes’s modal framework, focusing on the complex ways in which Descartes’ views on God and creation inform his understanding of necessity and contingency. The nature and scope of causation in Malebranche’s works are also explored in detail, particularly the ways in which Malebranche’s occasionalism shapes his views on modal reality. Schechtman concludes by offering interpretative claims about Locke’s views on necessary connections, bringing fresh clarity to Locke’s otherwise challenging and often misunderstood modal epistemology.
In ‘Crescas and Spinoza on Modality’, Yitzhak Y. Melamed offers a detailed comparison of Spinoza’s determinism and necessitarianism with Crescas’s theory of modality. This chapter is particularly engaging in its exploration of Spinoza’s radical rejection of contingency and his commitment to a thoroughly necessitarian universe. Melamed draws a clear distinction between two accounts of contingency, showing how Crescas’s modal theory provides an alternative to Spinoza’s extreme determinism. When properly articulated, these two accounts lead to what Melamed describes as a ‘consistent and mostly clear’ picture of modal reality. This chapter is notable for its depth in tackling Spinoza’s challenging metaphysical ideas and for demonstrating how pre-modern Jewish philosophy engaged in substantial modal debates.
The fifth chapter, ‘Leibniz on Modality’, by Samuel Newlands, addresses some of the most enduring questions in the history of modal metaphysics: ‘What exists, happens, or is true necessarily?’ and ‘What exists, happens, or is true contingently?’ (119). Newlands examines these questions through the lens of Leibniz’s broader metaphysical project, particularly his rejection of necessitarianism. Central to Newlands’s analysis is Leibniz’s notion of modal distribution and infinite analysis, which plays a key role in distinguishing between necessary and contingent truths. The chapter also discusses Leibniz’s moral necessity and how his modal views are linked to his broader ethical theory.
In ‘Hume on Modal Discourse’, Thomas Holden offers an intriguing interpretation of Hume’s treatment of modality. Holden argues that Hume’s account of necessity is rooted in human imagination and our natural cognitive limitations. While Hume famously rejects any metaphysical necessity beyond our imaginative constraints, Holden situates this within the broader framework of Hume’s expressivist’s theory of modality. According to Holden, Hume’s approach to modality is better understood through an expressivist lens rather than a representationalist one, suggesting that modal discourse reflects our mental states and linguistic practices more than it describes objective modal facts. This chapter contributes to a growing body of literature that positions Hume as an early precursor to contemporary expressivism in the philosophy of language and metaethics.
Nicholas F. Stang’s chapter, ‘Modality in Kant and Hegel’, addresses one of the most challenging philosophical debates between Kant and Hegel: the nature of modal categories. Kant analyses modality in relation to human cognitive capacities, treating modal concepts as tools for understanding our mental framework. In contrast, Hegel views modal categories as determinations of the objects themselves, independent of human cognition. Stang carefully navigates this complex disagreement, demonstrating that while the views of the two philosophers may appear irreconcilable, the underlying issues they address are strikingly similar. Despite this, Stang concludes that the distinctions drawn by Hegel cannot be fully mapped onto Kant’s framework, rendering the disagreement an enduring philosophical issue.
Moving into the 20th century, Kris McDaniel’s ‘Modality in 20th-Century Philosophy’ offers a sweeping overview of the major philosophical developments in modal thought, beginning with Kant’s influence on the century’s debates. McDaniel traces the impact of phenomenology, focusing on the contributions of Husserl and Heidegger to modality, while also examining the analytic tradition through figures like Russell, Quine, Barcan Marcus, Kripke, and Lewis. The chapter highlights the key role that developments in formal logic played in transforming modal metaphysics during this period.
The final chapter, ‘Modality and Essence in Contemporary Metaphysics’, by Kathrin Koslicki, engages with current debates surrounding the essence-based approach to modality. Koslicki summarizes the main arguments in favour of this view and discusses two specific ways of addressing counterexamples to it. Her chapter serves as a fitting conclusion to the book, as it connects the historical roots of modal theory to cutting-edge debates in contemporary metaphysics.
A refreshing addition to the book is the inclusion of four reflections: ‘The Necessity in the Cosmology of Tommaso Campanella’ by Emanuele Costa; ‘The Infinity of Worlds in Modern Kabbalah’ by Jonathan Garb; ‘Music and Modality’ by Domenica G. Romangi; and ‘Vacuism and the Strangeness of Impossibility’ by Rohan French. These reflections introduce a non-philosophical dimension to the discussion of modality, linking significant philosophical problems with practical, historical, and cultural issues.
I began this review by noting that many current issues in modal logic, metaphysics, and epistemology have their roots in the detailed, rigorous, and systematic theories of modality discussed in this book. The approaches we find in the history of philosophy continue to surprise us with their carefulness, attention to detail, and resilience against objections. To underscore this point, I would like to conclude with a specific and indispensable aspect of modality: impossibility.
Building on the so-called intensional revolution, the emergence of the hyperintensional revolution has significantly shaped our understanding of semantic, logical, and metaphysical issues. While it is unsurprising that the papers in this book do not address these matters using contemporary terminology, it is worth noting that these issues are present in their discussions nonetheless. Non-trivial reasoning about the impossible—particularly in relation to granularity, counterpossibles, and inconceivability—is often considered a relatively modern phenomenon. However, this book demonstrates that this is not the case, as every chapter treats impossibility as an equipollent dual to possibility. Whether in the role of reductio arguments or as the antecedent of counterpossible conditionals, the history of modality reveals meaningful and non-trivial reasoning about the impossible. Definitions of contingency and possibility require notions of necessity and impossibility. Moreover, Malink notes that impossibility, like possibility, is a sort of ‘capacity’ (4); Knuuttila, drawing on Aquinas’s work, identifies impossibility with ‘repugnance’ (40); Schechtman describes Descartes’s view of the vacuum as concerning the impossible (65); Melamed characterizes Spinoza’s perspective on impossibility as addressing chimera (93); Newlands explicitly identifies impossible worlds in Leibnizian thought (123); Holden emphasizes Hume’s identification of impossibility with inconceivability (158); Stang recalls the place of possibility—impossibility in Kant’s original table of categories (177); McDaniel considers Meinongianism—a thesis that includes impossible entities—as a way of making the Barcan formula more palatable (239); and Koslicki locates the debate about essence at the boundaries of necessity and impossibility. Finally, the very introduction of the book poses the question: ‘Can we make sense of and use the notion of an impossible world?’. This question prefigures the fact that every piece in the book takes impossibility seriously, not merely as a complement to other modal notions.
The above demonstrates that hyperintensional phenomena have engaged philosophers for centuries. I would therefore expect that at least some of the authors, including the editors’ introduction, would explore this subject more thoroughly, dedicating additional space to either the limitations of hyperintensional metaphysics or its development within the frameworks under discussion. For instance, traditional conceptions of God often portray God as consistent, typically within the context of possible worlds. However, many have argued that the range of possibilities acknowledged by classical logic constitutes only a proper subset of all possibilities (Beall, 2021). Given that the notion of God is, in fact, inconsistent (Grim, 2006), classical logic appears inadequate for addressing it.
Inconsistent suppositions often lead to trivial consequences—namely, trivialism. However, the principle that underpins this outcome, known as the Principle of Explosion, is problematic in itself. As Graham Priest notes, this principle originated in the twelfth century and, significantly, was absent in ancient logic (Priest, 1998). In fact, earlier logical systems, such as those of Aristotle and the Stoics, did not hold that contradictions necessarily resulted in trivial outcomes. This observation highlights an area of inquiry that warrants closer examination from both historical and systematic perspectives.
Modality: A History is an engaging introduction to the deep problems of modality. It shows that the views presented continue to exert significant influence on contemporary accounts, many of which have survived various turns in the history of philosophy. This makes the book an important addition to any philosophical bookshelf.
REFERENCES
Beall, J. (2021). The Contradictory Christ. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Grim, P. (2006). Impossibility Arguments. In Michael Martin (ed.), The Cambridge Companion to Atheism (pp. 199–214). Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Priest, G. (1998). What Is So Bad About Contradictions? Journal of Philosophy 95 (8), 410–426.