Laura Valentini’s book offers a careful, precise, and insightful analysis of an important issue in moral and political philosophy: When and why does following a socially constructed norm become a pro tanto moral obligation? Her answer is the “agency-respect view”: it is when and because we should respect the individuals’ agential commitments behind it (81). This is not meant to exhaust all possible moral reasons for following a socially constructed norm; Valentini allows that sometimes norms are morally binding due to the “the substantive merits” of their contents (54). But the agency-respect view is meant to exhaust the “content-independent” grounds for the moral force of a socially constructed norm—namely, those considerations that justify its being morally obligatory without appealing to its substantive merits (54).
This special interest in content-independent reasons is grounded in our intuitive and considered judgments. Valentini provides a series of cases where socially constructed norms seem morally binding despite the lack of substantive moral merits. One example that she frequently refers back to is Traffic Light, a case in rural Germany where many think that drivers ought to stop at the red light even without any risk of causing harm and without any witnesses around (57). This informal norm lacks substantive merits, but at least some people have the intuition that it is morally binding. Valentini observes that this intuitive judgment is structurally parallel to the judgment that there is an obligation to obey the law because it is the law (even when it lacks substantive merits)—which has been extensively discussed by legal and political philosophers. It thus seems worth asking whether there is a general content-independent explanation for the moral normativity of socially constructed norms, one that applies both to informal norms like rules of convention and formal norms like rules of law. This is the task that Valentini takes on in this book.
The first three chapters develop and defend the agency-respect view. Chapter 1 provides a definition of socially constructed norms. They are, on Valentini’s definition, those general rules of conduct widely and publicly accepted in the relevant context of analysis (22). Accepting a rule further requires believing in the content of the rule and being committed to the rule’s “functioning as a general standard of behavior” (28). This definition is adopted because it is best “suited to the theoretical tasks at hand” (18); it is not meant to be a pure conceptual analysis. A socially constructed norm, on this view, can be either “directive,” when it directly mandates or forbids a conduct (46), or “power-conferring,” when it indirectly does so by granting certain entities a normative power to alter the normative situation regarding conduct (20).
The most debatable aspect of this definition of socially constructed norms, to my mind, is its commitment component. Note that the requirement is not merely that enough individuals need to be committed to follow a rule themselves; they need to be committed to having the rule functioning as a general standard of behavior, and thus be disposed to “criticize and sanction” other people who fail to follow it (87). I think that this is too strong. Consider a case that I will call Birthday Gift, where enough individuals in a society are publicly committed to giving birthday gifts to their co-workers; however, when they see someone else violating this rule, they do not criticize or sanction them but feel sadness or frustration instead. The individuals therefore lack the commitment to the rule’s “functioning as a general standard of behavior” (28). However, it seems to me that the rule in Birthday Gift should still count as a socially constructed norm, even for Valentini’s theoretical purposes—after all, it still seems worth asking whether norms like this are morally binding.
Chapters 2 and 3 defend the agency-respect view. Chapter 2 is primarily negative and argues against the existing alternative approaches to the topic. Importantly, Valentini rejects the “deflationary view,” which denies any content-independent reasons for following a socially constructed norm. She argues that the deflationary view has limited explanatory power and also cannot accommodate intuitive judgments in cases like Traffic Light. Chapter 3 then advocates for the agency-respect view by arguing that it has adequate explanatory power and fits our intuitive and considered judgments. Here Valentini spells out the details of her view: there is a pro tanto moral obligation to follow a socially constructed norm when the norm-supporters’ commitments are (i) “authentic,” (ii) “morally permissible,” and when (iii) “respecting them is not too costly” (88). This is because we have a general moral obligation to respect commitments that satisfy these three conditions. Note that this account is still “content-independent” in Valentini’s sense, because none of (i)–(iii) appeals to a norm’s substantive merits. For instance, (ii) only states that a norm cannot be morally impermissible; it does not require a norm to be morally good in any way in order to gain its moral force.
I find Valentini’s negative arguments against the existing approaches fairly persuasive, and I am also sympathetic to the general theoretical framework of the agency-respect view. However, I am skeptical that each of (i)–(iii) is a necessary condition. Here I will focus on (iii), the requirement that respecting the agential commitments is not too costly. While this is obviously relevant to whether one all-things-considered ought to follow a norm, I am not sure why it is necessary for the existence of a pro tanto moral obligation in the first place. As an analogy, consider the obligation to fulfill one’s promises. It seems that, even if fulfilling a promise that I have made turns out to be excessively costly, I still have a pro tanto obligation to do so; the costs only matter because they may make me all-things-considered justified in not fulfilling the promise. One might thus be drawn to an alternative view where only (i) and (ii) are the necessary conditions. I suspect that worries of this kind are due to a more general limitation of the book: it only aims to provide a “modular and open-ended” framework (15), therefore avoiding subscribing to any substantive account of what it is for commitments to be “authentic,” “morally permissible,” or “not too costly to respect” (88). In fact, Valentini says relatively little about the specific meanings of these conditions when compared to the attention she puts toward defending the general structures of the agency-respect view. While the modularity of the framework is a virtue, it does make it more difficult to see why a specific component, such as (iii), is a necessary part of the framework.
The next three chapters then apply the agency-respect view to addressing three debates: the grounds of moral rights, the obligations to obey the law, and the wrongs of sovereignty violations. Across all three debates, Valentini identifies two distinct positions and proposes a “middle road” solution instead based on her agency-respect view. Chapter 4 concerns the debate between natural rights theory and conventionalism about rights. Valentini identifies a notion of rights—what she calls “rights as control” (123)—that require the right-holder to possess a normative power to alter other individuals’ normative situation by giving or releasing them from certain duties. She then argues that rights as control rely on power-conferring socially constructed norms, and they are therefore in an important sense conventional.
Chapter 5 addresses the debate about whether there is an obligation to obey the law because it is the law. According to the agent-respect view, the answer is positive but only when the commitments behind the law are authentic, morally permissible, and when respecting them is not too costly. Valentini provides more details about how these conditions apply in the case of political obligations. There needs to be an authentic, general commitment to the rule of law; the specific law at issue needs to be “reasonably just and procedurally egalitarian” (169); and following the specific law cannot be “too costly for one’s own agency” (169). Chapter 6 concerns sovereignty violations. The focus is on what Valentini refers to as “pure sovereignty violations,” namely, those violations of a political collective’s sovereignty that do not cause any harms or wrong any individuals (186). Two kinds of socially constructed norms are at issue: a state’s internal decision-making norms, and the external, international norms regarding sovereign equality. Applying the agency-respect view again, Valentini concludes that a pure sovereignty violation can still go against a norm of either kind, and it can still be pro tanto morally wrong if the relevant norm is based on authentic, morally permissible, and not too costly agential commitments.
I find these applications of Valentini’s agency-respect view nuanced and illuminating. The discussion successfully demonstrates the pervasiveness of socially constructed norms in informal, social, and political contexts, and it also helps fill out many details of the modular framework presented in the earlier chapters. Valentini makes an important observation that the conferring of normative powers across the promissory, political, and legal cases is structurally similar in their reliance on the underlying socially constructed norms, and she presents a convincing case for using agency respect to ground the moral force of these normative powers. This book will be a must-read for those interested in Valentini’s broad theoretical task, but it is also valuable to those concerned with the specific topics addressed—especially the ethics of conventions, normative powers, and political obligations.
ACKNOWLEDGMENTS
I would like to thank Ying Liu for helpful discussion on these topics.