Morality: From Error to Fiction

The view known as moral error theory (henceforth, simply error theory) holds that all moral statements are false insofar as they entail properties that do not exist. Proponents of error theory are confronted with what philosophers call the “Now What?” problem, which asks how we should respond to our pre-theoretic moral commitments given their falsity. While one may presume that error theorists would favor eradicating all remnants of moral thinking from our judgments and deliberations—a view known as moral abolitionism—it turns out that most self-identified error theorists believe people would be best served by preserving morality’s role in their lives. Such is the view of Richard Joyce, whose 2024 book, Morality: From Error to Fiction, provides the most in-depth and forceful defense of this position to date. In the book, Joyce sets out to establish that error theory is probably true and that error theorists are best served by adopting moral fictionalism. Moral fictionalism is roughly the perspective that incorporates error theory, along with the view that people should retain the traditional role that morality has played in both our language and in our deliberations due to the benefits it provides.

Though the first part of Joyce’s book is devoted to arguments in favor of error theory, the present review will focus on his defense of fictionalism, since his discussion and defense of fictionalism is the book’s most novel and important contribution. Much of the material that constitutes the first half of the book features arguments for error theory that appear elsewhere, particularly the material in Chapter 1 that summarizes J.L Mackie’s (1977) arguments against moral objectivism and the arguments against moral naturalism in Chapter 3 that Joyce previously addressed in his 2001 book, The Myth of Morality. Other competing accounts to error theory that Joyce sets out to disprove include noncognitivism, both non-naturalist and non-objectivist accounts of moral realism (Chapter 2), and accounts of morality that eschew moral responsibility (Chapter 4). In Chapter 5, he counters specific arguments aiming to refute error theory, including the charge that it is incoherent. It is worth mentioning that readers should not take my very cursory overview of the first part of Joyce’s book as any kind of indictment about the quality or importance of the material contained therein. The arguments for error theory that Joyce offers are among the strongest in the literature, and he presents them in a highly cogent fashion.^[1] 

Following a general discussion of the “Now What?” Problem in Chapter 6 and the nature of fictionalism in Chapter 7, Joyce sets out in Chapter 8 to establish fictionalism as superior to what he takes to be the two main competing versions of error theory: abolitionism and moral conservationism. Inasmuch as I find Joyce’s case against conservationism—which is similar to fictionalism, save for its recommendation that error theorists harbor genuine moral beliefs—to be generally convincing, the remainder of this review will center on Joyce’s claim that fictionalism is preferable to abolitionism. I should point out here that the “Now What?” Problem is strictly a pragmatic one that addresses the empirical question of which approach to moral claims and considerations would best serve the error theorist’s interests (and perhaps the interests of others). While the abolitionist’s view is based on the claim that traditional morality causes more harm than benefits to individuals and societies, the fictionalist maintains that traditional morality is mostly advantageous.

An important feature of Joyce’s fictionalism is that while the fictionalist will acknowledge the nonexistence of moral properties under certain circumstances, e.g., when pondering metaethical question, her acceptance of error theory will not typically appear in her conscious awareness. The fact that the fictionalist’s belief in error theory generally operates in the background of consciousness is what allegedly enables a fictitious moral belief—or what Joyce refers to as nondoxastic acceptance—to provide advantages to its possessor. Joyce likens the experience of maintaining a fictionalist account of morality to being caught up in a fictional movie and claims that “In everyday contexts, [the fictionalist’s] attitude toward morality will have the same phenomenology of belief—all the emotional, motivational, and practical advantages of moral belief—without being moral belief” (164).

To properly assess Joyce’s claim that fictionalism is preferable to abolitionism, it is necessary to weigh the benefits of adopting moral fictions against the costs. A key element of Joyce’s view is that nondoxastic acceptance must generally be categorical in the manner of Kantian obligations such that they are followed regardless of one’s self-interested desires. It is in virtue of this categorical feature, he maintains, that moral fictions can provide the following benefits: 1) they end practical deliberation about what to do; 2) they signal our allegiance to society’s values; and 3) they prevent weakness of will.

With regard to the first two, Joyce’s main point is that a commitment to moral fictions can prevent one from incessant deliberation about what to do, which can be debilitating. Of course, whether it is really advantageous for one to limit one’s deliberations and follow along with the prevailing social norms depends on whether adopting these norms is actually beneficial. Joyce has little to say about this point other than to assume that morality is generally useful (more on this later). Since it is an open question as to whether individuals and societies are best served by adopting prevailing moral norms, Joyce’s case for fictionalism appears to hinge largely on how likely nondoxastic acceptance is to combat weakness of will by issuing categorical orders that prevent one from, for instance, choosing lesser short-term interests over greater long-term interests.

At this point, a rather obvious objection presents itself. Given that the fictionalist accepts (in moments of clarity) that there are no genuine moral facts, why should we expect fictitious moral beliefs to exert any significant motivational power over him when he is confronted with a strong reason to act contrary to what these beliefs recommend? To see why Joyce’s brand of fictionalism may exert less motivational force than he supposes, it will help to consider why he believes that fictional moral beliefs hold an advantage over genuine ones. This supposed advantage is due to how the fictionalist, unlike the true believer, can dispense with accepted rules that are opposed to their long-term interests.

It is here that a possible internal inconsistency within Joyce’s fictionalism becomes apparent. This inconsistency stems from his advocacy of adopting fictionalist principles that have the kind of “no-questions-asked finality of Kantian conceptual content”, while maintaining that the fictionalist be aware that the adoption of such principles ultimately has a “Humean” or prudential justification, such that any given principle “can be recalibrated in the face of shifting pragmatic utilities” (172). And this awareness that any particular fictionalist principle is open to reassessment may reduce, if not altogether eliminate, its motivational impact. At the very least, being aware on some level that any fictionalist principles one adopts are ultimately grounded in pragmatic considerations sheds doubt on Joyce’s claim that fictionalist moral beliefs have all the phenomenological qualities of genuine (Kantian) ones.

Another issue facing Joyce’s fictionalist account stems from how its adoption could have a significantly negative impact on groups of individuals via its capacity for reinforcing negative aspects of folk morality. At the heart of Joyce’s fictionalism is the common assumption that “morality is, on balance, beneficial, and so we ought to keep it” (175). But is this correct?

One way of determining whether the effects of morality are mostly positive or negative would be to investigate whether individuals or societies that are more prone to engage in moral deliberation tend to be characterized by worse outcomes, such as a greater tendency toward violence. In what is perhaps the only study of its kind, Lazar Stankov and Jihyun Lee (2016) set out to explore this very subject. They found that a positive correlation between morality and violence holds among both individuals and countries/regions. For instance, they found that while eight out of the ten countries that measured as the least moral (where “moral” refers to the tendency of individuals or societies to emphasize morality in day-to-day life) have lower than average pro-violence attitudes, seven of the ten countries measuring as most moral have higher than average pro-violence attitudes.^[2] 

Beyond the research of Stankov and Lee, there are a variety of other indicators suggesting a close connection between morality and violence, as well as between morality and other negative outcomes. Perhaps the most obvious way that morality contributes to violence lies in the role it plays in promoting war. Under the reasonable assumption that moral arguments are an indispensable ingredient for any large-scale war to date—and likely for any genocide as well—it seems fair to conclude that morality has been responsible for the extermination of upwards of a billion lives through war alone (with many more non-lethally injured), given estimates that place the number of lives lost to warfare throughout history from the hundreds of millions to possibly over a billion (Hedges 2003). The casualties of morality are likely significantly greater, if we consider the role it has played in fostering incidents of smaller-scale violence that include, for example, acts of terrorism and corporal punishment.

The negative effects of morality extend well beyond its capacity to spawn violence. Consider, for instance, the negative role that moral considerations play in promoting government policies that oppose the general welfare. To take a few examples, consider the central role that moral arguments (specifically those invoking individual rights) have played in obstructing gun control and vaccinations in the U.S. which, in turn, have resulted in immense and unnecessary suffering and loss of lives. And while it is certainly true that moral arguments have played an important role in bringing about beneficial policies such as the end of slavery and the promotion of civil liberties, it is also true that some of the strongest obstacles to these policies were due to the moral arguments of those who favored the status quo.

My aim here is not to establish with anything approaching certainty that morality is more harmful than beneficial. Rather, it is to point out that morality’s defenders cannot simply assume that morality is mostly advantageous. This is a claim that requires in-depth empirical investigation. So long as we have good reasons for believing that morality generally produces worse outcomes, there is the worry that people stand to perpetuate negative outcomes by following the fictionalist’s recommendation that they play along with prevailing moral norms, thereby reinforcing harmful moral beliefs among the folk instead of working to abolish them.

While Joyce acknowledges the dark side of folk morality, his attempt to counter this worry is somewhat odd, in that he states that his focus is not on the role morality has played among present or past populations but rather on what attitude toward morality a population of error theorists should adopt. Since, according to him, informed error theorists would only adopt aspects of morality that have been shown to produce good outcomes, they need not worry about taking on the negative aspects of folk morality.

The problem with his line of argument is that we do not live in a world of error theorists who operate by the same understanding of benevolent morality. The real world is mostly populated by true believers whose moral views are built from a variety of concepts that often cause them to act in destructive ways. Insofar as our concern lies with determining which approach to morality is most pragmatic from the perspective of the error theorist—which is how Joyce conceives of his own project—the focus should be on adopting attitudes about morality that allow us to effectively navigate the actual world. These concerns notwithstanding, Joyce’s book succeeds in establishing fictionalism as a viable option for error theorists, and the potent arguments it contains for both error theory and fictionalism make it highly recommended reading for anyone with an interest in metaethics.

REFERENCES

Hedges, C. 2003. What Every Person Should Know About War. Florence, MA: Free Press.

Institute for Economics and Peace. 2012. Global Peace Index 2012.

Joyce, R. 2001. The Myth of Morality. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.

_______ 2006. The Evolution of Morality. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.

_______ 2024. Morality: From Error to Fiction. Oxford: Oxford University Press.

Stankov, L., and J. Lee. 2016. Nastiness, Morality and Religiosity in 33 nations. Personality and Individual Differences 99: 56–66.