Nietzsche’s Struggle Against Pessimism

A familiar way of writing a book about Nietzsche is to follow a particular topic through the corpus: art, religion, or truth, for instance. Patrick Hassan’s topic is pessimism. This is a good choice. Nothing is more central to Nietzsche than his “struggle” against the pessimism of his always revered “educator”, Arthur Schopenhauer. What is distinctive of Hassan’s discussion, however, is that he focusses not on Schopenhauer, but on the post-Schopenhauerian pessimists of whom Nietzsche had some knowledge: philosophers such as Julius Bahnsen, Eduard von Hartmann, and Philipp Mainländer. The confrontation between neo-Schopenhauerians such as these and critics such as Eugen Dühring constituted the “pessimism dispute” that endured from Schopenhauer’s death in 1860 until the end of the century. Though Nietzsche hardly even mentions such figures in the published texts—evidence of Nietzsche’s knowledge of them relies almost entirely on the Nachlass—Hassan justifies this change of focus by quoting Frederick Beiser (9). Unless we study Nietzsche’s “dialogue” with such contemporaries, he claims, “Nietzsche, despite the vast literature about him, will remain largely unknown” (9).^[1]

The book is divided into three parts corresponding to the three phases into which Nietzsche’s career is usually divided: an early Wagnerian phase, a middle, positivistic phase, and a final mature phase that one might think of as a synthesis of the two earlier phases.

Part I discusses Nietzsche’s initial engagement with pessimism in The Birth of Tragedy.^[2] The form of pessimism it considers is an argument from description to evaluation. “Descriptive pessimism” claims that “life’s sufferings essentially outweigh life’s pleasures” (34), while “evaluative pessimism” concludes that “Life is not worth living; non-existence is preferable to existence” (21). The suppressed premiss is “axiological hedonism”: “The only thing good for its own sake is pleasure or the absence of pain” (227). Not only Schopenhauer but also Hartmann and Mainländer subscribe to the hedonic principle.

The Birth accepts the truth of descriptive pessimism, but rejects the evaluative conclusion. It approaches the problem through art. According to Schopenhauer’s quasi-Kantian metaphysics to which The Birth subscribes, the world of spatio-temporal individuality is a realm of mere appearance, behind which is hidden the single, genuinely real entity, “the primal unity”. Nietzsche claims that in the Greek tragic festival we are carried away by the hypnotic singing of the chorus and as a result penetrate the illusion of individuality. We “become one” with the primal unity and share in its “creative delight” in the world of appearance (89). As Hassan puts it, the tragic audience “experiences a rapturous dissolution of their individuality and takes up a certain third-person, cosmic perspective on life as a whole, akin to an “artist-god” looking at existence as if it were a painting of a battlefield, and each individual was a soldier depicted in the spectacle (BT 5)” (91). From this Nietzsche concludes that as, but only as, an “aesthetic phenomenon” is existence “justified” (91). In transcending individuality, “the primal source of all evil” (BT 10), we transcend pain. Pessimism ceases to be ourproblem.

Hassan calls this “the artistic approach” (93: my emphasis) that The Birth takes to pessimism. This is odd since the whole point of the work is to explain the “Dionysian-Apollonian genius” (BT 5) that gave birth to Greek tragedy, a duality that never appears in Hassan’s discussion. In The Birth, there are, in fact, two kinds of art: the purely “Apollonian” art of Homer that covers over the horrors of life with a “veil” of glamorous illusion, and the art of the fifth-century tragedians. Here, while the singing of the Dionysian chorus gives us the “metaphysical comfort” of sensing our identity with the primal unity, the “healing balm” (BT 19) of Apollonian illusion make us incapable of understanding why we are comforted. The words and actions produce the “noble deception” (BT 21) that the world of individuals is the only real world, so that we exit the festival deceived into thinking that existence in the world of individuals is worth having (which implies that subjectively at least, it is worth having).

The problem with Hassan’s failure to recognise the element of Apollonian deception is that, as he presents Nietzsche, there is not even the appearance of a response to pessimism. On his account, life as the “artist god” is indeed enjoyable. But that is irrelevant to evaluative pessimism which claims that life as an individual (as one of the “soldiers” on the “battlefield”) is not worth having. And so the noble lie is an essential element in The Birth’s “solution” to pessimism. Needless to say, it is not a very good solution, if only because smart people like Nietzsche cannot help seeing through the deception. This is why the “struggle” against pessimism has to continue.

Part II of the work focusses on Nietzsche’s middle period. In Human-All-Too-Human, its central work, Nietzsche rejects neo-Kantian metaphysics and turns instead to naturalism, positivism, and axiological non-cognitivism. Influenced by Dühring and Paul Rée, he decides that the question of whether life is worth living is not a question of fact: “the world is neither good nor evil” because “‘good’ and ‘evil’ possess meaning only when applied to men” (120). Value judgments are “projections” of feeling, the varying ways which “paint” the world of facts (113). The only cognitive information they disclose concerns the psychology of the judger. The issue between life affirmation and life denial thus reduces to the familiar glass of beer: half-empty or half-full, depending on one’s psychological disposition.

Part III of the book begins with The Gay Science in which, says Hassan, Nietzsche’s attitude to pessimism takes its final form. As Human-All-Too-Human suggests, pessimism is “not really a philosophical theory at all but rather a non-cognitive state rooted in and expressive of the adherent’s character” (155). This sets the stage for an inquiry into the difference between the life-denier’s and the life-affirmer’s character. Nietzsche’s claim is that while the pessimist’s life-denial is the expression of a sick, “degenerate” character, life-affirmation is the expression of psychic “health”. Though Hassan goes into great detail concerning the “degeneration theory” circulating among Nietzsche’s contemporaries, his presentation of pessimism as pathological is really just an elaboration of the commonsense knowledge that while an increase in psychic energy brightens the world, a decrease darkens it. After a good night’s sleep the world sparkles and our problems are trivial; infected by the flu, the world is black and our problems are insurmountable. Pessimism and pessimistic worldviews such as Christianity are, says Nietzsche, the products of a lack of energy, of exhaustion: “Weariness . . . creates all gods and afterworlds” (184). Nietzsche’s (non-physiological) account of weariness and vigour as character traits seems to me an elaboration of Plato’s claim that to achieve anything significant one must become “one man”. The vigorous, puissant person has disciplined his or her drives into a hierarchy under the command of a single “master-drive” (168), the weary pessimist is someone who is exhausted by the effort of trying to make the horses of the soul pull in the same direction.

This presentation of the pessimist as a negative role model is part of Nietzsche’s “project of life-affirmation” (197). The problem, however, is that Schopenhauer, the zestful, flute-playing eviscerator of Hegel is anything but a low-energy type. Recognising the problem, Nietzsche resorts to a desperate expedient: Schopenhauer played the flute; therefore Schopenhauer was “not a pessimist” (193). But, of course, Schopenhauer is not an exception: the philosophical pessimists in general are likely to be reasonably vigorous types—it takes a lot of energy to write a book—so it seems clear to me, if not to Hassan, that Nietzsche is on a losing wicket here. “Assassinating” (EH III 2) the pessimist’s character will not do; if it is to be defeated, philosophical pessimism must be accorded theoretical status and subjected to rational critique.^[3]

Recall that, in the main, Nietzsche confronts pessimism in its hedonistic form: (1) life’s suffering outweighs its pleasures; (2) the only thing that makes life worth living is pleasure; therefore (3), life is not worth living. Hassan says that the “mature” Nietzsche never questions (1) (a claim to which I shall return). Instead, he attacks (2). There are “sources of value other than hedonism on the basis of which life can be found worth living” (228–9). Specifically, there is “greatness”, high, “history-shaping” achievement (245). Stereotypically, the lives of great individuals—Beethoven, van Gogh, tortured poets in general—are filled with suffering. Yet at least some of that suffering is “constitutive” of their greatness. Just as winning a race would not be a great achievement without stiff competition, so writing a “brilliant symphony” would not be a great achievement without “resistance”, i.e., suffering, without the achievement being, both subjectively and objectively, very difficult (248–9). I am sceptical of the analogy between athletics and art—Mozart’s Symphony no. 41 was called the “Jupiter Symphony” because it seemed (and perhaps was) tossed off with the effortless ease of a god—but Hassan is surely right that (at least in the case of military heroes such as Caesar and Napoleon), suffering is constitutive of their stature. And so since we allegedly admire great individuals more than any other while recognising that their lives often contain more pain than pleasure, greatness is a value we recognise as making a life worth living even though it contains more pain than pleasure.

One of the problems with this response to pessimism is that it seems to confine the possibility of a worthwhile life to the great, leaving the rest of us to live lives that are actually worthless.

Nietzsche deals with this problem, says Hassan, by allowing ordinary people to find derivative value in their lives either by committing themselves to the production of greatness (someone other than Goethe needs to wash his socks) or by basking in the reflected glory of the great (234–5). This is Nietzsche’s “aristocratism” that most people will find repellent—Hassan hastens to emphasise that his book is “wholly exegetical” (263). What he misses, however, is a quite different element in the “mature” Nietzsche’s response to pessimism according to which all of us, great and non-great alike, can, in fact, live worthwhile lives.

To become healthy life affirmers we must, says Nietzsche, become “poets of our lives” (GS 299). We must (long story short) narrate our lives as Bildungsromanen, stories of progress towards a life-defining goal in which the traumatic events—“the loss of a friend, sickness, slander, the failure of some letter to arrive, the straining of an ankle”—turn out to be things that have a “profound significance and use precisely for us” so that they “must not be missing” (GS 277). In a well-narrated life, traumas turn out to be causal contributions to (or possibly constitutive of) one’s life-defining goal: it was the injury to the ankle, perhaps, that turned me from the nasty, brutish, and short life of professional football to the wonderful life of professional philosophy. Here, the key concept is not “greatness” but rather “meaning”. “If you have your ‘why?’ of life”, says Nietzsche, “you can put up with almost any ‘how?’: man does not strive for pleasure (Glück); only the Englishman does that” (TI I 12).

This critique of hedonistic utilitarianism is clearly a rejection of the second premiss in the pessimist’s argument (only pleasure makes life worth living). But I think that Nietzsche also rejects the first premiss (life’s suffering outweighs its pleasures). In Thus Spoke Zarathustra, the hero is asked by his “animals” whether he is “searching” for happiness. “What matters happiness to me”, he replies, “I have my work”—his mission to redeem humanity. “But”, reply the animals, “do you not dwell in a sky-blue lake of happiness?” Smiling at their unexpected perspicacity, Zarathustra admits that he does (Z IV 1). This is the “paradox of happiness”. As psychologists increasingly recognise, happiness is achieved not by its “pursuit” but is rather the by-product of absorbed dedication to a project, best of all, to a life-defining project. This, however, is precisely what is achieved in a life of meaning, a life constructed and lived as a Bildungsroman. And so—barring some unsurmountable tragedy—the life of meaning is a happy life. What follows from this is that Nietzsche has an impressive, and in my view conclusive, argument against descriptive pessimism. Most well-constructed lives will be, on balance, happy—i.e., “pleasurable”—lives,^[4] in which traumas are all “redeemed” (TI IX 49) as essential parts of a happy whole. Barring catastrophe, those who live lives of suffering will be those who narrate their lives badly, or not at all.

If one is interested in nineteenth-century German intellectual history, Nietzsche’s Struggle Against Pessimism is a fascinating book. The reader will have noticed, however, that despite Hassan’s claim that without a close examination of Nietzsche’s “dialogue” with Schopenhauer’s epigones he remains “largely unknown”, I have managed to summarise most of the content of his book with virtually no reference to the epigones. Apart from the treatment of Hartmann’s philosophy as a joke in the second Untimely Mediation (which Hassan does not discuss) and two other glancing references to him, GS 357 is the only place in which the epigones appear in the published texts. This raises the question of why, if there really was a “dialogue”, Nietzsche never allowed it to become public. He was, after all, far from unwilling to interact with those he recognised as “significant others”—Socrates, Plato, Epicurus, Spinoza, Goethe, Darwin, Wagner, and, of course, Schopenhauer—in the published texts. In GS 357 he says that while Schopenhauer is an essential figure who really understood what pessimism was, neither Hartmann, Bahnsen, not Mainländer did—and are thus discountable. I have not been convinced that he was wrong about this.