Recently, analytic philosophy has paid increasing attention to the distinction between ideal and non-ideal theorizing in philosophy, and many philosophers have worried about the risks of problematic idealizations in philosophical theories. Engelhardt’s book, Nonideal Theory and Content Externalism, is a brilliant and much-needed contribution to this growing literature. Discussions about the dangers of ideal theories in philosophy have focused mostly on debates in political philosophy (e.g., Mills, 2005; Valentini, 2012; Hänel & Müller, 2025), although recently there has been interest in the issue in other sub-fields such as epistemology (McKenna, 2023), social ontology (Burman, 2023), and philosophy of language (Tirrell, 2018a; 2018b; Beaver & Stanley, 2023; Keiser, 2023). Discussions in philosophy of language have focused mostly on questions in pragmatics, including, for instance, the nature of conventions, speech acts, and the common ground.
Englehardt’s work is the first book-length treatment of the specific problems of ideal theorizing in the area of semantic content. For that reason alone, the book is worth reading. But furthermore, the book is extremely clear, well written, and very persuasive in my view. It focuses on a very popular semantic theory in analytic philosophy, namely, semantic externalism, which claims, in a nutshell, that the meanings and extensions of many terms are fixed not by what is in our heads but rather by external factors. Semantic externalism, then, makes claims both about what are the meanings and extensions of many of our terms, and about what the processes are that determine those meanings and extensions.
Engelhardt provides an extremely clear, detailed, and careful discussion of what these linguistic mechanisms are supposed to be, according to standard and influential versions of semantic externalism, how these versions include problematic idealizations, and how to de-idealize those versions to build better, de-idealized versions of the semantic theories that can represent reality more accurately. The main problem with the idealized versions of semantic externalism, Engelhardt argues, is that they abstract away from systematic cases of oppression and injustice. And these idealizations are not mere simplifications that aid in the comprehension of the theories, but rather, these simplifications end up distorting reality in crucial ways, so that the resulting theories obscure important aspects of the reference-fixing mechanisms, and therefore yield incorrect results, given the aims of semantic theories.
At the beginning of his book, Engelhardt discusses Mills’ influential argument against ideal theorizing in political theory and examines to what extent it can be extended to theories in philosophy of language. In brief, Mills’ argument has it that since one of the main goals of political theory is to help us improve the world, to rely on theories that abstract away from injustice and oppression does not seem likely to help us improve the world. However, Engelhardt claims, drawing also on Cappelen & Dever (2021), that the goal of semantic theories is to represent reality accurately rather than improving the world. Hence, one of Engelhardt’s aims in his book is to develop an argument against ideal theorizing in semantic theories that does not depend on the assumption that the aim of inquiries in semantics is to improve the world.
I will summarize some of the main tenets of this novel line of argument (which in my view is very persuasive), but before that, I would like to say something about the Millsian argument. Recently, many philosophers have paid attention to the idea that in philosophy, often what is at issue is not what our current concepts actually are but rather what our concepts ought to be, as the new field of conceptual ethics or conceptual engineering proposes (e.g., Burgess, Cappelen & Plunkett, 2020). According to this framework, then, it is not clear that theorizing in philosophy of language is independent of the project of improving the world. Hence, it could be argued that for the purposes of conceptual engineering, to rely on semantic theories that ignore the existence of injustice and oppression might not be conducive to proposals that help to improve language, since many of the flaws of our current linguistic resources will be ignored as well.
But putting this aside, Engelhardt’s project of developing an alternative line of argument against ideal theorizing is very commendable. Let me summarize his argument briefly. His main aim is to show that two extremely influential versions of semantic externalism, namely, natural kind externalism (Ch. 2) and social externalism (Ch. 3), contain problematic idealizations and should be de-idealized. (In Ch. 4, he draws some conclusions regarding the applications of his insights with respect to issues about epistemic injustice and conceptual engineering, which I will touch upon briefly below.)
For the sake of space, I will focus mostly on his arguments regarding natural kind externalism (Ch. 2). He first explains some traditional versions of this view, and he then argues that some modifications are in order, introducing Haslanger’s influential new version, known as objective-type externalism. This view extends the insights of externalism about natural kind terms (according to which the contents of natural kind terms are fixed by the external natural kinds in causal contact with the speakers who introduce the term) to any terms referring to objective types, not only natural kind terms. Engelhardt poses some criticisms to Haslanger’s version of objective-type externalism, proposing a nuanced version of objective-type externalism.
The main difference is as follows: whereas Haslanger’s version of objective-type externalism still claims (according to Engelhardt) that the reference of objective-type terms is determined by those objective types in the vicinity themselves, rather than anything in the speakers’ heads, but where ideology can mask what these referents really are, the nuanced version of externalism that Engelhardt proposes introduces some complications. In particular, on Engelhardt’s nuanced version, the reference of objective-type terms is determined in virtue of three phases, as follows: (1) speakers introducing the term attempt to pick out an objective type by ostension or some other mechanism, (2) empirical researchers discover what the objective type is (where there is room for some stipulations), and (3) ordinary speakers react to the results of empirical researchers, where these reactions can vary, including assent or dissent; if ordinary speakers dissent, then the results of empirical researchers may not determine the referent after all.
Engelhardt argues that all these phases play a role in determining the content, whereas on Haslanger’s version of objective-type externalism, the referent is already fixed in the first phase. Engelhardt then argues that oppression and injustice can systematically affect the processes involved in all the three phases, altering what the referents turn out to be. Hence, Engelhardt concludes that oppression and injustice can systematically influence both the referents of our terms, and the meaning-fixing processes. This discussion is extremely clear, careful, and detailed, offering a very useful picture of how oppression and injustice can influence meaning-determining mechanisms in different ways, and at different stages of the processes involved. In this way, this rich discussion can teach us how linguistic mechanisms, by means of how they work in real life, can not only cause but also constitute injustice and oppression.
The conclusion is well motivated, in my view. However, it could be argued that Engelhardt’s interpretation of Haslanger’s version of objective-type externalism is too strict. It is true that Haslanger’s view has evolved over time, and as I understand it, Engelhardt’s interpretation might be a useful interpretation of Haslanger’s discussions of externalism in Haslanger (2005, 2006), where she is mostly interested in explaining how the referents of gender and racial terms might have been obscured by ideology, and in particular, the referents have been determined by processes that are not transparent to competent speakers, but rather independently of anything in our heads. In this sense, Engelhardt’s interpretation seems plausible, his critiques seem apt, and his modified version of objective-type externalism seems to be an improvement over Haslanger’s version.
However, Haslanger has also emphasized in more recent works the dynamic nature of the processes of meaning-determination, and how our shared practices of coordination can play a role (e.g., Haslanger 2010, 2016). For instance, in Haslanger (2020), she introduces the notion of orientation, which has to do with speakers’ attitudes towards the terms’ external semantic content, and she argues that orientations play a role in the individuation of concepts and can also play a meta-semantic role in the determination of meaning. In any case, Engelhardt’s rich discussion will be of interest to anyone interested in meta-semantics in general, or in the semantics of social terms, in particular.
Engelhardt concludes his discussion with some remarks about the applications of his arguments with respect to hermeneutical injustice and conceptual engineering. He argues that if he is right, then oppression and injustice systematically influence the referents of many of our terms. In this way, many of our terms have referents that are due to oppression, and hence unjust. This provides further reasons to believe that there is hermeneutical injustice, since there are many concepts and meanings in our shared conceptual repertoires that should not be there, and also some meanings that are missing but should be included in our shared repertoires. In this way, Engelhardt’s arguments provide a very useful contribution to this growing debate, as well as some foundational bases for explaining the mechanisms and background causes that give rise to hermeneutical injustice.
Furthermore, Engelhardt’s discussion makes crystal clear the connection between problematic reference-fixing mechanisms that are wrongly influenced by oppression and thus yield terms’ referents that are unjust, on the one hand, and the existence of shared conceptual repertoires that involve flawed meanings that are oppressive, as well as conceptual lacunas where concepts should be, on the other. And moreover, these considerations provide strong additional reasons for the need of conceptual engineering projects that assess our shared conceptual resources and improve them. Engelhardt’s book provides an extremely illuminating discussion on all these inter-connected issues.
REFERENCES
Beaver, David & Stanley, Jason (2023). The Politics of Language. Princeton: Princeton University Press.
Burgess, Alexis; Cappelen, Herman & Plunkett, David (eds.) (2020). Conceptual Engineering and Conceptual Ethics.New York, USA: Oxford University Press.
Burman, Åsa (2023). Nonideal Social Ontology: The Power View. New York, US: Oxford University Press.
Cappelen, Herman & Dever, Joshua (2021). “On the Uselessness of the Distinction between Ideal and Non-Ideal Theory (at least in the Philosophy of Language).” In Justin Khoo & Rachel Sterken, Routledge Handbook of Social and Political Philosophy of Language. Routledge.
Hänel, Hilkje Charlotte & Müller, Johanna M. (eds.) (2025). The Routledge Handbook of Non-Ideal Theory. New York, NY: Routledge.
Haslanger, Sally (2005). “What are we talking about? The semantics and politics of social kinds”. Hypatia 20 (4):10-26.
Haslanger, Sally (2006). “Philosophical analysis and social kinds”. Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society 106 (1):89-118.
Haslanger, Sally (2010). “Language, Politics, and ‘The Folk’: Looking for ‘The Meaning’ of ‘Race’”. The Monist 93 (2):169-187.
Haslanger, Sally (2016). “Theorizing with a purpose: The many kinds of sex.” In Catherine Kendig, Natural Kinds and Classification in Scientific Practice. Routledge. pp. 129-144.
Haslanger, Sally (2020). “How Not to Change the Subject”. In Teresa Marques & Åsa Wikforss, Shifting Concepts: The Philosophy and Psychology of Conceptual Variability. Oxford: Oxford University Press. pp. 235-259.
Keiser, Jessica (2023). Non-Ideal Foundations of Language. New York, NY: Routledge.
McKenna, Robin (2023). Non-Ideal Epistemology. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Mills, Charles (2005). “Ideal Theory as Ideology”. Hypatia 20 (3):165-184.
Tirrell, Lynne (2018a). “Authority and Gender: Flipping the F-Switch”. Feminist Philosophy Quarterly 4 (3).
Tirrell, Lynne (2018b). “Toxic Speech: Inoculations and Antidotes”. Southern Journal of Philosophy 56 (S1):116-144.
Valentini, Laura (2012). “Ideal vs. Non-ideal Theory: A Conceptual Map”. Philosophy Compass 7 (9):654–664.