Since the 1990s, Ishtiyaque Haji has set out a number of concerns for morality that derive from causal determinism’s threat to our ability to do otherwise. In Obligation and Responsibility, he develops these concerns in innovative and interesting ways. Some of these are advances on his previous arguments, but the new book also features several new and challenging avenues of inquiry.
In Chapter 1, Haji sets up the plan of the book with Four Putative Contrasts, three of which he rejects (1, 2, and 4), and one of which he accepts (3):
1. Moral responsibility, and blameworthiness in particular (and it’s the basic desert sense that’s at issue), does not require the ability to do otherwise. Evidence for this is provided by the success of Frankfurt cases, whereas if one accepts the ought implies can principle, moral obligation does require this ability. Haji argues that both blameworthiness and moral obligation require the ability to do otherwise.
2. Responsibility semicompatibilism—the thesis that even if determinism is incompatible with the ability to do otherwise, it is compatible with moral responsibility—is true. The parallel thesis, semicompatibilism about moral obligation—that even if determinism is incompatible with the ability to do otherwise, it is compatible with moral obligation—is false. Haji argues against both kinds of semicompatibilism.
3. Moral responsibility historicism (aka moral responsibility externalism) is true—how agents acquire their values, and, more broadly, their responsibility-relevant psychology, may affect how and the degree to which they are morally responsible. Historicism/externalism about moral obligation is false. Haji advocates in favor of this contrast.
4. Obligations can change with time’s passage, but blameworthiness cannot. While due to changes in circumstances one may now no longer have an obligation that one once had, one cannot, due to changing circumstances, now fail to be blameworthy for something for which one was formerly to blame. Haji argues against this contrast by endorsing changeability of blameworthiness.
In Chapter 2 Haji sets out the core claims of his overall position:
PAP-Responsibility: An agent is morally responsible for doing something only if she could have done otherwise.
Ought Implies Can (OIC): If it is obligatory for you to do A, then you can do A (and if it is obligatory for you to refrain from doing A, then you can refrain from doing A).
Equivalence: It is obligatory for you to refrain from doing A if and only if it is impermissible for you to do A.
OIC and Equivalence jointly entail that there is a requirement of alternative possibilities for impermissibility, parallel to PAP-Responsibility:
Impermissible Implies Can Avoid (IAvoid): If it is impermissible for you to do A, then you can avoid doing A.
In Chapter 3, Haji argues that obligation semicompatibilism is ruled out because obligation and prohibition require alternative possibilities for action. As in earlier work, Haji also argues on grounds of symmetry that given the principle: if it is impermissible for you to do A you can refrain from doing A, then, also, if you ought to do A you can refrain from doing A. He engages Nadine Elzein in a spirited debate about this controversial claim.
In Chapter 4, Haji contends that although Frankfurt examples provide reason to believe that moral responsibility does not require alternative possibilities, semicompatibilism about moral responsibility is undermined due to the link between blameworthiness and impermissibility together with the principle that impermissibility requires alternative possibilities (cf., Nelkin 2011, who argues similarly).
Chapter 5, especially new and original, challenges a widely endorsed compatibilist account of OIC and PAP, that the ‘could have done otherwise’ in these principles is compatible with determinism because its best interpretation does not involve holding the past and the laws fixed. The ‘could have’ or ‘can’ in these principles is thus weak, by contrast with the strong ‘can’ that does involve holding the past and the laws fixed. Haji develops an argument against the weak ‘can’ in these contexts, which I address below.
Chapter 6 compares moral responsibility externalism and internalism to their deontic counterparts, obligation externalism and internalism. With Al Mele (2019), Haji argues that responsibility externalism is true, but contends that obligation externalism is false, and provides an explanation of this asymmetry: while judgments of moral responsibility are primarily assessments of agents and only secondarily of acts, assessments of obligation, by contrast, primarily concern acts and not agents.
Chapter 7 expands on the conclusion of Chapter 6 by invoking radical reversal stories to test whether other kinds of appraisals are sensitive to history. Haji argues that judgments of practical rationality, which in his view are also agent-focused, are history-sensitive. Because love is reasons-sensitive, one’s history can also affect whether one indeed loves another and the value of one’s love.
Chapter 8 defends the claim that one can be blameworthy for an action one has not yet performed but will at a future time, and that one’s blameworthiness can change over time depending on intervening circumstances. Haji’s view, not widely endorsed, is as he points out parallel to a generally accepted thesis about obligation: agents can have obligations for future actions, and those obligations can change due to intervening circumstances.
Chapter 9 discusses the proposal that of the various sorts of obligation—moral, legal, and prudential—moral obligation is overriding. Haji contends that the alternative-possibility requirement for obligation compromises this thesis. He also discusses the implications this requirement has for punishment as deterrence and the quarantine proposal for criminal treatment, arguing that these options are compromised by their reliance on obligation, duty, and blame.
Chapter 10 closes with further reflections on the Four Putative Contrasts. The general conclusion Haji reaches is that the only item on this list that captures a genuine difference is item 3. Obligation and responsibility are far more similar to each other than contrasts 1, 2, and 4 specify.
There is much to discuss here, and I need to be selective. As noted, one of the book’s central aims is to push back against semicompatibilism, which Haji once endorsed. Pioneered by John Martin Fischer in the 1980’s and 1990’s (e.g., Fischer 1994), semicompatibilism maintains that although causal determinism is not or might not be compatible with the ability to do otherwise, it is compatible with moral responsibility. The incompatibility with the ability to do otherwise is motivated by a sympathetic response to the consequence argument (van Inwagen 1983). The compatibility with moral responsibility is motivated partly by Frankfurt cases, in which an agent is intuitively morally responsibility despite a potential intervention which excludes the ability to do otherwise (Frankfurt 1969). Haji has been favorably disposed toward Frankfurt cases, but here he argues that this disposition is in tension with an argument for the incompatibility of moral obligation and determinism.
In Haji’s view, moral obligation does require freedom to do otherwise, due to the ought-implies-can (OIC) principle (cf., Nelkin 2011). If you morally ought to do A at t but refrain from doing so, then OIC implies that you could have done A at t. Thus, if the ability to do otherwise is ruled out by determinism, moral obligation is also ruled out by determinism. But, Haji argues, if moral obligation is ruled out by determinism, so is moral impermissibility and wrongness. For its being impermissible or wrong for you to do A is equivalent to its being morally obligatory for you to refrain from A. Furthermore, Haji argues that you are blameworthy for doing A only if either (1) it is impermissible for you to do A or (2) you believe that it is impermissible for you to do A. But nothing is impermissible in deterministic worlds, and in enlightened deterministic worlds—worlds in which determinism is true and all agents believe that it is together with its implications—no agents believe that it’s impermissible to do A. So, no agents will ever be blameworthy in such deterministic worlds.
This argument has considerable force. In the past I’ve disputed the proposed equivalence of morally impermissible/wrong and morally ought-not by arguing that there are notions of wrongness that would remain in place even if moral obligation is undermined by determinism. For example, it would still be legally wrong to evade taxes even if due to determinism it is not morally obligatory to refrain from evading taxes. And it would plausibly be wrong in some sense for a psychopathic serial killer to murder people even if his condition makes it true that he cannot do otherwise and for this reason he is not morally obligated to refrain from killing (Pereboom 2001, 2014). I’ve also proposed that there is an evaluative sense of ‘ought’ that remains in place even if moral obligation is undermined by determinism (Pereboom 2014). But these specific issues are not the main focus of Haji’s new book.
Haji recognizes that an important objection to his position is that the sense of ‘can’ in the OIC principle is not the strong sense that involves holding fixed the past and the laws, but a weak sense that does not hold them fixed. This is the topic of Chapter 5. As Haji puts it, “you strong–can do otherwise than what you do only if, given exactly the same laws of nature and the past, you do something other than what you do. Contrastingly, you weak–can do otherwise only if there is a world with a slightly different past (or laws) in which you do otherwise” (121). This weak sense of ‘can’ was proposed by David Lewis (1981) in objecting to Peter van Inwagen’s consequence argument, and in favor of the claim that determinism is compatible with the ability to do otherwise and has since had many proponents (e.g., Nelkin 2011, Brink 2021).
Haji contends that a very weak sense of ‘can’ ties it only to general and not to specific abilities (cf., Mele 2003). As he sets out this distinction, you have a general ability to ride a bike insofar as you have the intrinsic powers—e.g., balance, motor control, pedaling and steering skills—to ride. You retain this ability when you’re asleep and when there is no bike is available to you. Your ability is increasingly specific to the extent that you have the opportunity to access a bike and the time to ride and to the extent that you have increased physiological and psychological capacities to ride. On the basis of this characterization Haji contends that specific and general abilities form a continuous spectrum—from maximally general on one end and maximally specific on the other (cf., Whittle 2021).
Semicompatibilists deny that the agent in a Frankfurt case has the ability to do otherwise, a putative condition for moral responsibility. But they agree that this agent retains a general ability to do otherwise, and this indicates that the sense in which he lacks the ability to do otherwise concerns a specific ability. Semicompatibilists also hold that this agent is blameworthy, and hence that the action at issue is impermissible. But, Haji argues, this impermissibility requires that he could have done otherwise in some sense.
Haji then issues a challenge to the view that impermissibility requires only a weak–can do otherwise (122ff.). He begins by arguing that “there is no reason why worlds where you weak–can do otherwise than A are worlds where your ability to do otherwise is near the extreme pole at which your specific ability is most robust in the sense of being specific to a high degree. . . .Rather, your ability to do otherwise may reside anywhere along this spectrum of specific ability.” But then, “what nonarbitrary reasons are there to think that this ability to do otherwise does not “cross” or “spill over” into general ability territory and, hence, is no longer specific?”
A question arises about the dialectic as it is represented here. Haji affirms a principled reason for denying that the ability required for moral obligation and impermissibility is general, and compatibilists are within their rights to avail themselves of this reason. It’s intuitive that when you are too drunk to drive or when your car has broken down five miles from the airport you do not have a moral obligation to pick your friend up at the airport as you’ve promised, even though you retain the general ability to do so. This suggests that the ability in question is specific. But Haji pushes back against this move:
Weak–can advocates cannot rightly appeal to the pre–theoretical presumption to support the view that impermissibility’s “can do otherwise” denotes specific ability to do otherwise simply because, pre-theoretically, they have little reason to accept this assumption. Even if weak–can advocates can produce independent support for the view that the ability to do otherwise than A when A is obligatory for you is a specific ability, plausibly, this independent support will itself invoke the premise that obligation’s ‘can’ is weak. This would be dialectically improper when the issue concerns whether this ‘can’ is weak or strong.
This is contestable. The compatibilist has a right to the argument that the ‘can’ linked to obligation and impermissibility is not the ‘can’ of general ability without prejudice as to whether the ‘can’ of specific ability is weak or strong. The claim that it is not general is not ideologically compatibilist. Once the specificity of the ability is agreed upon, then the partisan debate can begin as to whether the ‘can’ at issue is weak or strong.
Furthermore, compatibilists may propose that there is a way to determine the specificity of the sense of ‘can’ in alternative-possibilities judgments: by consulting our intuitions in cases, in particular, cases in which specific abilities are at issue. The compatibilist may propose that a principled determination of the level of specificity can be attained via such an examination of cases.
Here is a case of this sort (McKenna and Pereboom 2016, Pereboom 2021). Consider language-speaking abilities: Mario is a native Italian speaker but is also fluent in English. His abilities to speak Italian and English persist over time, and he retains them when he is not exercising them—these are general abilities. But imagine a case in which a specific ability to speak one of these languages is at issue. Mario and I are in New York, we’re in an Italian restaurant, the menus are in both Italian and English, and our waiter reveals he’s from Italy that he speaks Italian. Here Mario has a high degree of pertinent psychological and physiological capacities and a prime opportunity to order in Italian. But suppose he orders in English. I then say to him: “You could have ordered in Italian!” It’s intuitive that what I said is true. However, supposing determinism, if in assessing the truth value of “You could have ordered in Italian!” the past and the laws of nature are held fixed, its truth is ruled out. It seems right to loosen what’s held fixed in a particular way instead, and thus the sense of ‘can’ in this context would be a weak one of a specific sort. This argument is independent of compatibilist presuppositions. Due to such cases, the compatibilist seems justified in claiming that a weak sense of can has a justified footing in cases in which a specific ability to do otherwise is at issue.
In the final chapters of the book, Haji argues in favor of additional disturbing consequences of determinism. One might think that only resolutely backward-looking accounts of blame and punishment are challenged by Haji’s argument from determinism, but he contends that forward-looking views are also vulnerable. In Chapters 3 and 4, Haji cites radical reversal cases that can be used to argue in favor of historicism. In one of his cases, the manipulators implant evil values into morally virtuous Sally, who then murders George while retaining the non-historical conditions on moral responsibility. The manipulators subsequently restore her original values. Haji, with Mele, finds it intuitive that M(anipulated)-Sally is not blameworthy in the basic desert sense. But he also maintains that M-Sally is not appropriately blamed in the forward-looking moral protest sense I’ve proposed, and intended to be determinism-friendly:
Moral Protest Account of Blame: For A to appropriately blame B is for A to adopt a stance of moral protest against B for immoral conduct B has performed and that A is epistemically justified in attributing to B, and A’s adopting this stance is morally justified. (Pereboom 2021; cf., Hieronymi 2001)
I specify that blaming in this sense does not involve the intentional infliction of harm conceived as basically deserved or as a non-instrumental good. Rather it is morally justified insofar as it can be anticipated to secure objectives such as reconciliation with those who have done one wrong and the moral formation of those disposed to do wrong.
Haji finds it highly implausible that M-Sally is protest-blameworthy, for the reason that “her values are not “her own;” I see no inconsistency in wedding this sort of “ownership” requirement to a forward-looking view of blameworthiness such as Pereboom’s. Haji also suggests that ownership is linked to a kind of self-creation that is incompatible with determinism.
Against this, suppose that we, the protest blamers, are aware that the manipulators have implanted the evil values into Sally, but that no subsequent original value restoration is planned. Sally has just committed an evil act, and we can agree with Haji that she lacks ownership of her values in the sense he specifies. But given that Sally is responsive to moral reasons, a condition of the protest account of blame, blame as protest seems appropriate. The reason is that such blame is intended to advance moral reform, and it stands to do so in this case. Instead of an ownership condition on protest blameworthiness, I’d favor reasons-responsiveness and a relatively consistent personality over time.
Haji’s Obligation and Responsibility is an impressively crafted and closely reasoned book that challenges not only compatibilist claims, but also the hopes for retaining morality and responsibility free will skeptics have set out. Together with his earlier works, the new book constitutes the most formidable challenge to morality based on determinism available.
REFERENCES
Brink, David. (2021). Fair Opportunity, Responsibility and Excuse, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Fischer, John Martin. (1994). The Metaphysics of Free Will, Oxford: Blackwell Publishers.
Frankfurt, Harry. (1969). “Alternate Possibilities and Moral Responsibility,” Journal of Philosophy 66: 829–39.
Haji, Ishtiyaque. (1998). Moral Appraisability, New York: Oxford University Press.
Haji, Ishtiyaque. (2002). Deontic Morality and Control, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Lewis, David. (1981). “Are We Free to Break the Laws?” Theoria, 47: 113-21.
McKenna, Michael, and Derk Pereboom. (2016). Free Will: A Contemporary Introduction, London: Routledge.
Mele, Alfred. (2003). “Agents’ abilities,” Noûs 37 (3):447–470.
Mele, Alfred. (2019). Manipulated Agents: A Window to Moral Responsibility. New York: Oxford University Press.
Nelkin, Dana K. (2011). Making Sense of Freedom and Responsibility, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Pereboom, Derk. (2001). Living without Free Will, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Pereboom, Derk. (2014). Free Will, Agency, and Meaning in Life, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Pereboom, Derk. (2021). Wrongdoing and the Moral Emotions, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Whittle, Ann. (2021). Freedom & Responsibility in Context (Oxford University Press, 2021)