Paul Thom’s Opera as Art provides a sketch of a philosophy of opera informed by twelve case studies from Claudio Monteverdi’s Orfeo (1607) to Alban Berg’s Wozzeck (1925). Thom defines opera as a performing art involving “the human voice, language, movement, instrumental music, and visual display.” What differentiates opera from other performing arts that involve some of these ingredients is opera’s use of accompanied singing to represent “characters engaging in dramatic action” (2).
The ontology that underpins Thom’s account generally conforms to what David Davies (2011) refers to as the “classical paradigm.” Opera performances are performances of pre-existing works authored by composers and librettists. As such, the performers’ aim is to faithfully present these works to audiences and, ideally, do so in a way that also articulates artistic statements of their own. Operatic performances ought to be judged by their faithfulness to the work, which includes its music, sung text, and (controversially) stage directions (10). Additionally, opera audiences ought to be interested in “the creativity that the interpretation displays, by way of reinterpreting the work’s instructions in a metaphorical sense, or by way of making substantial additions to them” (176).
Not all operatic works are art, according to Thom. For an opera to be art, the work must possess a theme that is “worthy of reflective consideration,” and which is “present in all levels” of the opera’s structure (4). Accordingly, pasticcios such as Handel’s Catone (1732) or Jeremy Sams’s The Enchanted Island (2011) are operas, but they are not art, because they fail to articulate a unifying theme. Thom also argues that some opera productions (e.g., Peter Stein’s staging of Pelléas et Mélisande at the Welsh National Opera in 1992) are rightly regarded as artworks, if they are preserved in “an enduring medium” and possess artistic properties beyond those of the work being performed (178).
From the foregoing summary, philosophical readers may expect the book to be made up of a series of chapters on the medium of opera, the evaluation of operatic works, the relationship between operatic works and their performances, the evaluation of operatic performances, and the conditions under which such performances ought to be regarded as works in their own right. Instead, Thom presents the foregoing claims rather briskly in the book’s Introduction and Conclusion. The book’s core is structured as a historical survey of opera like Joseph Kerman’s Opera as Drama (1956) or Carolyn Abbate and Roger Parker’s A History of Opera (2012).
Each of Thom’s twelve main chapters focuses on an opera subgenre (e.g., opera seria, opera buffa, bel canto) in a chronological progression. Thom first shows how the subgenre arose from “a particular historical conception of art” (5). Some of these discussions, such as the relationship between Johann Mattheson’s doctrine of the affections and opera seria, will be familiar to students of opera history or the work of Peter Kivy (especially Osmin’s Rage: Philosophical Reflections on Opera, Drama, and Text, which Thom curiously never mentions). Others, such as the relationship between Kant’s idea of free beauty and bel canto’s liberation of vocal music from “any obligation to serve the words,” strike this reader as both novel and persuasive (79).
Thom selects one representative work of each subgenre and describes how its composer and librettist communicate a unifying theme through their poetry, music, and intended staging. Along the way, Thom raises present-day debates in philosophy and opera studies at relevant moments. For example, in connection with Debussy’s many revisions to Pelléas et Mélisande (1902), Thom considers the conditions under which a work ought to be regarded as finished. At the end of each chapter, Thom describes a recent production of the opera and how it interprets or reinterprets the work’s theme. Due to the book’s modest length and dozen chapters, Thom is unable to consider some of its philosophical questions in as much depth as philosophers may expect. For instance, the discussion of completeness may have benefitted from consideration of work by Stephen Davies (2007),Kelly Trogdon, and Paisley Livingston (2014).
The book’s intended audience is unclear to me. I suspect that my philosophical colleagues may be confused by its chronological rather than topical organization as well as its lack of substantive engagement with previous work in the philosophy of the performing arts. Thom assumes rather than explicitly argues for the applicability of the classical paradigm to opera, despite its incongruence with some of the productions he discusses. For example, Thom makes the following observation about Barrie Kosky’s 2017 production of Die Meistersinger: “Wagner’s opera can be seen as one among many ‘ingredients’ from which the production is made. To this extent the production should be assessed primarily for its achievements as an artwork in its own right, rather than for its fidelity to Wagner’s opera” (116–17). From what Thom says about Kosky’s production, this sounds right. But Opera as Art doesn’t provide readers with the theoretical resources to understand and appreciate an opera performance that is not a performance of a preexisting work.
Thom cites James Hamilton (2007) but does not outline Hamilton’s “ingredients model” by which theatre performances are works in their own right, ones that may or may not employ preexisting works as ingredients. Such a theoretical framework may have helped readers come to a deeper understanding of the productions by Barrie Kosky and Peter Konwitschny which Thom describes. Other productions Thom discusses are more coherent under a modified version of the classical paradigm, such as David Davies’s (2011, 112) suggestion that presenting a performance of a work of theatre is better understood as being true to its “emplotted point” rather than as following all its performance directions. In Penner (2020), I argue that contemporary opera performance admits of two paradigms: some productions like Kosky’s fit Hamilton’s ingredients model, others a version of the classical paradigm according to which opera performances are faithful to the work’s point, in Davies’s sense, conveyed through a “moderately faithful performance of the work’s plot and score, as defined by the performing practices for which it was written” (178). Thom’s case that certain productions are rightly regarded as works would have been more robust and persuasive if Thom had drawn more explicitly from previous work on theatre and considered productions that not only contain cuts or reinterpreted stage directions but different music (discussed in Cowgill (2012), Poriss (2009), and Penner (2020)).
At various points in Opera as Art, Thom stipulates that works must endure. This is a requirement other philosophers, such as Andrew Kania (2011), have made (though Kania uses it to reject the idea that jazz performances are works). It’s not precisely clear how Kosky’s Meistersinger endures. Thom remarks that Trisha “Brown’s (1998) production of Orfeo can be seen as itself a work for performance. Its performance instructions were instilled into the memory of the performers during the rehearsal process and endured in that form for the length of the run of performances, until the memories gradually faded” (17). With other productions, Thom mentions that a video recording was made, and that is presumably how he came to such detailed knowledge of at least some of these productions. Are recordings ways opera performance-works can endure? Engagement with philosophical work on jazz and dance may have strengthened this portion of Thom’s argument.
Given the book’s chronological presentation and focus on analyzing operas as opposed to philosophical concepts, perhaps its primary audience is a musicological one. There are a few reasons why I may hesitate to recommend this book to my colleagues in musicology. Thom draws deeply from musicological writing about the works he discusses. But because of his choice of works, his book ends up feeling rather disconnected from current discourses in musicology today.
There is nothing in Thom’s definition of opera that would exclude American musicals or Chinese opera, yet the only works he considers are European operas from the seventeenth to the early twentieth centuries. To be clear, my issue lies not with Thom’s definition or even with his decision to focus on a particular operatic tradition, but rather with his taking a Eurocentric focus for granted in 2023. His privileging of Italian and German works from the long nineteenth century makes sense when one considers the value he places on coherence and unity. Within the past twenty years, the appropriateness of using values rooted in nineteenth-century German aesthetics to evaluate works composed outside of this tradition has been questioned, leading to reevaluations of composers such as Puccini and entire subgenres such as operetta. More recently, there has been an increasing amount of work on opera outside of Europe and North America (e.g., André 2018, Budasz 2019, Ingraham, So, and Moodley eds. 2016).
Although Thom’s emphasis on opera production responds to the performative turn in opera studies that began about twenty years ago, Thom doesn’t engage with the substantive body of work on singers (e.g., Aspden 2013, Henson 2015, Poriss 2009, Rutherford 2006, White 2018). Opera as Art provides little sense of opera as a living artform in which new works are not only created through the ingenious interpretations of directors but also by living composers and librettists. For these reasons, I conclude that the primary audience for this book is less opera scholars than lovers of common-practice European opera interested in the connections between this body of works and various philosophical ideas.
At the outset of Opera as Art, Thom states that “a philosophy of opera should give an account of the nature of operatic practices, of the ways they are linked with one another, of the ways they differ from the practices of other performing arts, and of the specific character of operatic art” (1). Opera as Art contributes to all of these topics. Because of its organization and emphasis, however, Thom is only able to provide “sketches” of these arguments rather than the deeper dive philosophers may seek. Nonetheless, given that the multimedia musical arts remain a neglected area within the philosophy of music, Opera as Art is a welcome contribution. As a musicologist invested in building bridges between musicology and philosophy, it was encouraging to see Thom draw more deeply from my field than is typical among philosophers. Thom’s engagement with work in opera studies brings depth to his analysis of the works under consideration as well as historical and contemporary practices of performing these works.
REFERENCES
Abbate, Carolyn, and Roger Parker. A History of Opera. New York: Norton, 2012.
André, Naomi. Black Opera: History, Power, Engagement. Urbana: University of Illinois Press, 2018.
Aspden, Suzanne. The Rival Sirens: Performance and Identity on Handel’s Operatic Stage. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2013.
Budasz, Rogério. Opera in the Tropics: Music and Theater in Early Modern Brazil. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2019.
Cowgill, Rachel. “Mozart Productions and the Emergence of Werktreue at London’s Italian Opera House, 1780–1830.” In Operatic Migrations: Transforming Works and Crossing Boundaries, edited by Roberta Montemorra Marvin and Downing A. Thomas, 145–86. Burlington: Ashgate, 2006.
Davies, David. Philosophy of the Performing Arts. Malden: Wiley-Blackwell, 2011.
Davies, Stephen. “Versions of Musical Works and Literary Translations.” In Philosophers on Music: Experience, Meaning, and Work, edited by Kathleen Stock, 79–92. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2007.
Hamilton, James R. The Art of Theater. Malden: Wiley-Blackwell, 2007.
Henson, Karen. Opera Acts: Singers and Performance in the Late Nineteenth Century. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2015.
Ingraham, Mary I., Joseph K. So, and Roy Moodley, eds. Opera in a Multicultural World: Coloniality, Culture, Performance. New York: Routledge, 2016.
Kania, Andrew. “All Play and No Work: An Ontology of Jazz.” Journal of Aesthetics and Art Criticism 69, no. 4 (2011): 391–403.
Kerman, Joseph. Opera as Drama. Rev. ed. Berkeley: University of California Press, 1988.
Kivy, Peter. Osmin’s Rage: Philosophical Reflections on Opera, Drama, and Text. Rev. ed. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1999.
Penner, Nina. Storytelling in Opera and Musical Theater. Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 2020.
Poriss, Hilary. Changing the Score: Arias, Prima Donnas, and the Authority of Performance. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2009.
Rutherford, Susan. The Prima Donna and Opera, 1815–1930. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2006.
Trogdon, Kelly, and Paisley Livingston. “The Complete Work.” Journal of Aesthetics and Art Criticism 72, no. 3 (2014): 225–33.
White, Kimberly. Female Singers on the French Stage, 1830–1848. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2018.