Parmenides: New Perspectives

This volume offers ten essays on the philosophy of Parmenides, presenting different viewpoints on perhaps the most influential and challenging Presocratic philosopher. The essays by leading international scholars deal with issues ranging from Parmenides’ use of mythological allusions to his argumentation and the impact of later thinkers on the interpretation of his thought.

In “The Way out of the World: How Parmenides Played with the Cosmology of Early Greek Poetry” (1-20), Arnaud Macé examines the mythological setting of Parmenides’ poem, in which the unnamed youth is welcomed by the daughters of Helios at the gates of the House of Night. There he meets an unnamed goddess who narrates the remainder of the poem. But where is the House of Night? Macé helpfully examines passages from early poets dealing with the mansions and paths of Helios, Night, and Day. But do the gates the youth enters lead to the heavens or the underworld? We find no clear and consistent account in the several poetic parallels. “Having thus extracted the highest cosmological achievements from the early poetic tradition”, Macé concludes, “[Parmenides] merges the two motifs of the Sun’s journey and of the Gates of Day and Night, and pushes them to their limits…into the depths where even the gods lose their bearings” (18). Macé provides a valuable review of the mythological world Parmenides draws on and wisely avoids treating the proem as a mere allegorical construction.

In “Between Thought and Thing: The Argument of Parmenides B8.6-9” (21-36), Matthew Evans examines a key argument of Parmenides’ goddess that what-is cannot be generated from what-is-not. The main premise of the argument is that “It is not to be said or thought that [what-is] is not” (23). Parmenides seems to argue from a semantic premise to a non-semantic (metaphysical) conclusion about the world. Evans considers a “deflationary reading” in which we eliminate any semantic premises, in part because the distinction between semantic and non-semantic could be anachronistic. But if we look back to fragment B2, Parmenides seems clearly to be committed to something like a semantic reading. Evans now suggests that we take the semantic premises of the argument to support the non-semantic “primary claim” that “It is not possible that [what-is] is not” (34-5). The point is that “you are (rationally) compelled to accept the non-semantic premise of the source argument [namely, B8.6-9]” (35, emphasis in original). This seems plausible. Historically, philosophers have often recognized a link between what was conceivable and what was possible on the one hand, and what was inconceivable and impossible on the other.

In “Truth and the True in Parmenides” (37-53), Alex Long offers a philological study of alethēia and related terms in Parmenides’ poem. Whereas Thomas Cole had rejected the rendering ‘reality’ and the like in favor of “something like ‘conscientious reporting’” and sees Parmenides as going further in the direction of ‘truth’, John Palmer has argued against the latter and defended the former. Re-examining epic and poetic usages, Long presents the view that “Parmenides’ use of words for truth and reality is more similar to that in early poetry than Cole himself acknowledged” (38). Long renders alēthēs in Parmenides as ‘accurate’ in B8.39, and in B8.17-18, B1.30 and B8.28 as ‘truth-telling’ (42-43, 45). Long provides a helpful review of previous studies of alethēia and related terms in early Greek literature and in Parmenides, but the rendering ‘truth-telling’ seems a bit strained.

Barbara M. Sattler addresses Parmenides’ use of logic in “Parmenides’ Method: The Power of Indirect Proofs” (54-72). She aims “to show that Parmenides’ poem can be understood as the beginning of indirect proof in philosophy and how these proofs work in his poem” (54). She begins by pointing out that indirect proof is not the same thing as a reductio ad absurdum, for the latter can be used a direct proof. She also points out that the use of counterfactuals does not by itself constitute indirect proof.

In B2 and B3, Parmenides establishes that there are only two “ways of enquiry”, that (it) is or that (it) is not. Although he seems to introduce a third way in B6, he dismisses that possibility, without, however, offering a clear argument against it. In B8, he then identifies signs of the true way, for which he “gives a series of indirect proofs showing that Being cannot be F and thus has to be not-F” (67). Parmenides seems to reflect “some new methodological awareness” of the importance of indirect proofs, possibly based on the fact that we cannot talk or think about not-being (68-69). It remains unclear whether mathematics influenced philosophy or vice versa, she observes, but indirect proofs became prominent in both fields about the same time. Sattler analyses Parmenides’ use of indirect proof and documents his influence in making it an important feature of philosophical discourse.

In “Parmenides and the Centred View” (73-90), Lea Cantor examines Parmenides’ simile comparing what-is to a sphere (B8.42-49). This passage has long been controversial: is what-is literally spherical in shape, or merely perspectivally neutral? Cantor takes the latter approach, but rejects an external viewpoint in favor of an internal one. “No matter in which direction I look from the centre, reality will look the same, and in this sense all perspectives will collapse into one” (86, emphasis in original). But this creates a new problem, because “a hypothetical observer at the centre of a sphere would not know that she is inside a sphere, let alone at its centre” (87). This leads to the further problem that “in thinking and speaking about the limits of thought…one somehow has to think and speak about the unthinkable”, which would “suggest that we [humans] are incapable of taking a perspectivally neutral view on being” (87). We end up confronting an irreducible tension between the “intelligibility of being” and the limits of human cognition (88). Cantor’s inquiry challenges us to see how we can reconcile the alleged intelligibility of being with limitations of human fallibility. One may wonder, however, if this concern arises from Parmenides himself or from a kind of postmodern deconstruction.

In “A Parmenidean Self-Exegesis” (91-112), David Sedley explores the possibility that Parmenides published a version of his poem with his own commentary attached. Simplicius reports a commentary on Parmenides’ poem that purports to come from the poet-philosopher himself (Phys. 31.3-7). Although earlier editors had dismissed the supposed source as deriving from a scholium, Sedley defends it, citing Plato’s Sophist as supporting evidence for a Parmenidean prose commentary.

Focusing on what Parmenides allegedly says about his two morphai, Sedley cites “Hesiod’s first and most fundamental dualistic division of the…cosmos” as “Sky and Earth” (105). It is this division that Parmenides latched onto with his Light and Night. But, Sedley warns, these two forms should not be taken (as mortals take them) as “a pair of compresent contraries” but as “alternating contradictories” (108). Parmenides’ language suggests that the properties associated with Light are real, while those associated with Night are mere names (109-110). His commentary reveals “a radical asymmetry between the two antithetical cosmic principles that mortals have distinguished” (111). Sedley gives us a great deal to think of in terms of the “self-exegesis” of Parmenides. But this account would, it seems to me, drive a stake into the heart of empirical astronomy by undermining the very important role of opaque mass and shadow that mark Parmenides’ great discovery of the moon as a dark sphere reflecting the sun’s light (a feature emphasized by Karl Popper).

In “The Value of Perception in Parmenides” (113-29) Jenny Bryan argues that fragments B6 and B7 “represent neither an outright rejection…nor a demotion of sense perception”; “Parmenides is concerned with the way that we perceive and communicate rather than with what we perceive or with how we think about our perceptions” (113, emphasis in original). Examining B6 and B7, she points out that the goddess warns not only against failed perception, but against false speaking because of a tendency to conflate what-is and what-is-not. She finds that the

analysis of fragment B8.53-9…indicates that [mortals’] failure results from the decision to perceive the cosmos in a manner that incorporates what-is-not. They are blind, deaf, and mute because they do not perceive or communicate what-is as it is. (125, emphasis in original)

Bryan admits it is difficult “to identify an example of successful perception within the poem” (125). She suggests that Parmenides, like Xenophanes, might have had in mind other modes of perception that did not involve what-is-not. The alternative, however, remains elusive. Bryan is right to warn us against assigning to Parmenides a rejection of sense perception per se.

André Laks confronts the problem of being in “Parmenides and Mortality: A Proposal” (130-49). Reviewing recent studies on Parmenides, he reminds us of Barnes’ claim that Parmenides did not argue for a monistic conclusion and of Patricia Curd’s argument that Parmenides advocated a “predicational monism” that in principle allows for a pluralism of kinds of entities.

Laks follows Jean Bollack in interpreting the goddess’ statement at B8.53-54 as objecting to the positing not of two forms, but of two gnōmai, “ideas” or “thoughts”; the idea that the goddess wants to preclude is that of non-being (140). Mortals should recognize the two forms they posit as both being onta (141). The method discussed in the Doxa should be viewed not as a third way, but as an application of the right way, one that is eoikōs, “appropriate” and in conformity with the way things are (145-46, 130). Laks offers an attractive solution to the tension between the first and second parts of Parmenides’ poems. On this account, the first part presents a semantic or essentialist account of what-is, rather than what we might call a full-blown ontology; the second part presents an application of that account with a dualistic ontology which avoids the introduction of non-being.

In “Beyond the Doxa: The Third Part of the Goddess’ Speech in Parmenides’ Poem” (150-73), Massimo Pulpito addresses the connection between the first and second parts of the poem. The problem is, “if the second discourse concerns others’ opinions without truth, why devote such meticulous [and extensive] attention to those opinions?” (153). He helpfully notes that in the poem we find “two major families of interpretation on the subject”, one collecting “readings that strongly assert the incompatibility between the two discourses”, and another with “readings that admit of some degree of compatibility between the two discourses” (153, emphasis in original).

In B1.31-32, the goddess promises to show “how things believed [dokounta] should have been believable [dokimōs], completely penetrating through all things” (156-59). Besides the transition from the first to the second discourse in B8.50-52, Pulpito sees another transition at B8.60-61, which promises to explain how the “ordering of things” is “completely fitting” so that mortal opinions will never “outstrip you” (159-60). There are grounds for recognizing a third discourse here, one that is not Doxa, but Diakosmos (165). Of the two forms, Light and Night, we should not see the latter as non-being. Both forms have demas and dunameis, “material structure” and “powers”, so that “nothingness partakes in neither” (B9.4) (168-68). In the end, the incompatibilists are right to say the Doxa proper is incompatible with the Truth; the compatibilists are right insofar as the Cosmic Ordering, the third discourse, is compatible with the Truth (171). Pulpito offers a vigorous defense of Parmenides’ cosmology by separating it from the Doxa proper by basing it only on ontological principles derived from the first part of the poem.

Mathilde Brémond examines the structure of Eleatic arguments in “Gorgias’ Antilogical Arguments and the Reception of the Eleatics” (174-92). Many reconstructions by ancient commentators of Eleatic arguments take the form of an “antilogy”: “1) For φ to be true, either ψ or not-ψ must be true; 2) ψ is impossible; 3) not-ψ is impossible; 4) Hence, φ is false” (174). When we compare the reconstructions with the original texts, however, we find that they lack the opposition of ψ and not-ψ. The opposition can be traced to Gorgias’ treatise On Not-Being. Gorgias’ reading of the Eleatics, including Xenophanes, influenced Plato, as seen in the Parmenides, and Aristotle in his own reconstructions of Eleatic arguments. Aristotle passed this interpretation on to later commentators, and the pseudo-Aristotelian treatise On Melissus, Xenophanes, and Gorgias preserves and promotes this view. Brémond’s study is a valuable corrective to a tendency to project antilogies back onto the Eleatics, when in reality the argument form arises from Gorgias’ rhetoric.

The essays in this collection deal with a wide range of topics offering valuable insights into the poem of Parmenides and the theory it expresses. Several of the essays offer different approaches to the relationship between the first part of the poem with its monistic approach and the second (and third?) part(s) with a dualistic cosmology, but it continues to require clarification. Parmenides’ poem marks a historical turning point in philosophy. It was only in the twentieth century that Parmenides’ impact on philosophical development became clear; the twenty-first century is still struggling to clarify what precisely his message was, and how it was received by Parmenides’ successors.

Parmenides’ cosmology presented for the first time three new insights that turned out to constitute scientific breakthroughs: that the Morning Star is identical to the Evening Star, the moon gets its light from the sun, and the earth is spherical in shape.^[1] Parmenides thus managed to achieve what earlier natural philosophers had sought but never attained: correct scientific explanations of natural phenomena. Whatever he meant to accomplish, Parmenides presented a paradigm for later cosmological theories. He provided not only a turning point for philosophy, but also a starting point for empirical science, specifically, that of astronomy.

The present work offers a rich reflection on the language, thought, and theory of Parmenides of Elea. It reminds us that the paradox that was Parmenides still remains to be resolved.

REFERENCES

D. W. Graham, Science Before Socrates (Oxford: 2013).