What happens to a clay statue after you squash it? Some say it ceases to exist, but the lump of clay—a distinct object that had been co-located with it—continues to exist. Others say that the statue ceases to exist and is replaced with a new object, a squashed lump of clay. Here’s a different answer. The statue, which is also a lump of clay, continues to exist and merely ceases to be a statue. Being a statue, the idea goes, is just a phase that the lump of clay passes through, just as being a teenager is a phase that a person passes through. This natural, “phasalist” treatment of the statue-clay puzzle has not received the attention it deserves. There are no representatives of phasalism in Rea’s landmark anthology Material Constitution, for instance, and the Stanford Encyclopedia entry on material constitution devotes only one sentence to it.
In Phases of Objects, Justin Mooney rectifies this neglect. He defends a general metaphysics of material objects that delivers the phasalist account of statues and lumps, while also rendering verdicts on a wide variety of other puzzling cases. For example, his view entails that a human being can become a corpse, that the Ship of Theseus can become a cabin in the woods, and much more besides. The book is full of careful, fine-grained engagement with metaphysical subtleties and thoughtful analyses of hard cases. And it’s a refreshing and invigorating return to the golden age of material-object metaphysics, before it was dominated by universalism vs. nihilism, metametaphysics, and grounding.
This is a terrific book, and we recommend it enthusiastically to anyone with an interest in persistence and coincidence puzzles. In what follows, we present Mooney’s view in greater detail (§1), examine some of its unappealing implications (§2), and discuss some alternative versions of phasalism that may be more palatable (§3).
1. Phasalism and Spatiotemporalism
Mooney’s primary innovation is filling out the basic phasalist picture with a carefully crafted spatiotemporal criterion of identity (43-50), applied across the board to any material object of any sort, people included. According to this criterion, a material object will persist just in case two conditions are met. First, there’s a continuity condition: the object must follow a spatiotemporal path that includes no excessive causal or spatiotemporal discontinuities. Second, there’s a closest-continuer condition: the object must follow a spatiotemporal path that exhibits greater continuity than any rival path. We’ll call his thesis that all material objects are subject to this sort of criterion spatiotemporalism.
Spatiotemporalism delivers the phasalist treatment across a wide range of cases. The statue merely ceases to be a statue when squashed, but continues to exist since the squashing exhibits the needed unrivaled spatiotemporal continuity. When a long piece of yarn is knitted into a sweater, unraveled, and then knitted into a scarf, there all along was just the one material object, which was a sweater and a piece of yarn, then was just a piece of yarn, and is now a scarf and a piece of yarn (87-89). A pumpkin can become a carriage (44). A terrier can become an amorphous mass of cells (70).
Spatiotemporalism is similarly liberal about part loss and replacement. In some cases, this liberalism has attractive consequences. Clay statues and, thus, the pieces of clay with which they are identical, can gain and lose parts without ceasing to exist (66-67). (Here we applaud Mooney for breaking with the bizarre dogma that lumps have all their parts essentially.) In other cases, the results are more surprising. For example, material objects can survive the replacement of all of their parts. And not just organisms and ships: a piece of lead can become a piece of gold (68). That’s the good news for alchemists. The bad news is that you need to already have the gold and the patience to swap it out one piece at a time. Spatiotemporalism also has the surprising consequence that, if we were to dismantle the Empire State Building by removing one small portion after another, we might finally arrive at a situation in which the Empire State Building is a small piece of steel that fits comfortably in a breast pocket (cf. 62-65).
So how do material objects cease to exist on Mooney's view? Sometimes they cease to exist when they break into pieces. A windowpane ceases to exist when it’s shattered—unless one piece is over half the size of the original windowpane, in which case the windowpane survives as the largest shard (62). This is also how people normally cease to exist on his view: not when they die, but at some point in the process of cremation or decomposition (186-188). Though, depending on the order of events, your end might be later than you think, and, like the Empire State Building, you might wind up as a piece of bone that comfortably fits in a breast pocket.
Objects also cease to exist when, as a result of part loss, they would otherwise shrink down to a region already occupied by one of their parts. For instance, when a door composed of a board and a knob loses its knob, the door ceases to exist, not because it isn’t spatiotemporally continuous with the board, but because the post-knob-loss board is a closer continuer of something else, namely the pre-knob-loss board (104-106). (As Mooney sees it, part loss doesn’t always result in shrinking down to a region already occupied by a part, since he doesn’t believe in arbitrary undetached parts.)
2. Remnant Survival
To our minds, the hardest cases for spatiotemporalism involve what Mooney calls “remnant survival”, where an object is split into differently sized pieces, the smaller of which seems to have the better claim to being the original object. One such case that Mooney addresses involves a vining plant that covers an entire brick wall, and that is later snipped right at the base (69-71). The living plant, now just a couple of inches high, continues to grow. Intuitively, this very plant (pointing to the two-inch remnant) once covered the wall. But according to spatiotemporalism, the two-inch-high plant cannot be the plant that once covered the wall. No material object can survive that sort of abrupt spatial discontinuity. Mooney bites the bullet, and you might think that’s not so bad. But there are more troubling cases of remnant survival. We will mention two.
First, suppose the Statue of Liberty—a hollow, copper statue—is seamlessly filled with copper, one small bit at a time, until it is completely solid. Imagine that we were to remove the internal “core” all at once, apparently returning the Statue of Liberty to its initial state. Surprisingly, spatiotemporalism entails that the Statue of Liberty is the removed core in this case (97-98). The hollow statue that remains is a perfect duplicate of the statue we started with, made of exactly the same copper atoms, which were (we may suppose) never disturbed. Nevertheless, spatiotemporalism entails that it is not the Statue of Liberty. Indeed, despite the fact that there’s a piece of copper there that is made of exactly the same copper atoms as the original piece, arranged in exactly the same way, this piece is not identical to the original piece according to spatiotemporalism.
Second, and in our view most troublingly, are cases of remnant survival involving people. Take the real-life case of Jasmine Ramirez. At the age of 14, Jasmine’s tumor-ridden leg was removed after it had grown to 174 pounds, leaving behind a roughly 100-pound one-legged amputee. Mooney cannot say that Jasmine becomes the amputee, since no material object (on his view) can survive such an abrupt spatial discontinuity. Nor, for that matter, does Jasmine become the severed leg (since that’s what the pre-surgery leg becomes). Nor will Mooney identify Jasmine with a scattered object composed of the amputee and the severed leg, since Mooney thinks there are no such scattered objects (3-4). Rather, Mooney is forced to say that Jasmine simply ceases to exist when the leg is removed.
It gets worse. We just saw that the amputee can’t be Jasmine herself according to spatiotemporalism, so what was the amputee up to prior to the surgery? The spatiotemporalist is faced with various options, none of which is especially attractive. For example, one option is to say that the amputee was a second person co-located with Jasmine prior to the amputation. But, as Mooney acknowledges in connection with disembodied brains (192-196), this option runs directly into the familiar problem of “too many thinkers”. Mooney could instead embrace immaterialism about people, something he is understandably reluctant to do (162-163), and which would in any case not answer the question of what to say about the history of the one-legged organism. Another option is to say that the amputee came into existence at the time of the surgery. But it seems obvious that, if there’s a conscious person at all where the amputee is, that person is Jasmine, the person who once had two legs. In light of this, we suppose the spatiotemporalist might try simply denying that there’s a conscious person where the amputee is. This is in effect Mooney’s line on brains in vats, but it strikes us as intolerable when applied to our relieved amputee.
3. Other Phasalisms
Some metaphysicians may be inclined to dismiss the whole phasalist approach on account of the counterintuitive implications we’ve highlighted here. But you know what they say about throwing stones in glass houses. (We’re looking at you universalists, nihilists, mereological essentialists, plenitudinists, and all Lewisians.) What’s more, Mooney does attempt to ameliorate some of his troubles by developing a nonstandard account of what it means to be “the same F” (125-133). This account allows him to say that the tiny vining plant is the same plant as the (numerically distinct) massive plant that was once covering the wall (153), that the piece of lead is not the same piece of matter as the piece of gold that it becomes (cf. 139), and that the filled-in Statue of Liberty is the same statue as the (distinct) statue with the core removed (140). In any case, whether or not these efforts to render the view more palatable succeed, it really is a tidy picture that Mooney gives us: all material objects are ultimately the same sort of thing, all with the same persistence conditions, and within Mooney’s system it is always clear which object is which.
But even for those who, like us, are unconvinced, there is great value in the book. In the course of developing his own tidy and extreme (tidy because extreme!) metaphysics of material objects, Mooney touches on various decision points for the phasalist, and in doing so, effectively illuminates a whole family of underexplored phasalist approaches. We see his book as a helpful jumping-off point for a fruitful investigation of the different versions of phasalism.
Indeed, Mooney himself at times contemplates departing from spatiotemporalism in ways that could secure a more intuitive treatment of some of the cases we’ve mentioned. In connection with the vine case, he makes an intriguing suggestion that the spatiotemporal continuity condition could in principle be relaxed in cases where some other robust form of continuity is present (71). If biological and psychological continuity are permitted to trump spatiotemporal continuity in this way, the phasalist could say that Jasmine survives as the amputee, since the one-legged girl exhibits significant continuity of both sorts with Jasmine pre-amputation. The downside of such adjustments is that the view gets messier, and is unable to deliver clear verdicts about the full range of cases unless supplemented with guidelines for what trumps spatiotemporal continuity and under what conditions. But for those (like us) who doubt that a tidy metaphysics can capture the messiness of our world, this is a promising avenue to explore.
Another version of phasalism pairs it with a view on which there are two fundamentally different types of material objects, only one of which is subject to the spatiotemporal criterion. For instance, Carmichael (2015) develops a view on which there are, at bottom, two kinds of material objects. First, there are “lump-like objects”, which include stones, statues, sweaters, lumps, and pieces of yarn. Second, there are “event-based objects”, paradigmatically, organisms. By adopting the spatiotemporal criterion just for the former, and applying, e.g., a biological criterion to the latter, we can retain the phasalist treatment of statues and sweaters, while also securing the intuitively correct result in the various remnant survival cases (including Jasmine). This view would also, for better or worse, entail that living organisms do not persist as corpses.
Finally, it’s worth exploring what we might call a “pure immanence” view. As indicated above, persistence (on Mooney’s view) requires a sort of causal continuity: an object persists partly in virtue of the fact that there being something that’s a certain way at the later time is “immanently caused” by there being something that was (largely) that way at the immediately preceding time (44-46). Perhaps this causal constraint can stand on its own, without any spatial or temporal constraints. When multiple objects at some later time are immanently caused to have some range of properties by O having those properties at the earlier time, O survives as whichever object is immanently caused to have O’s properties to a greater (and sufficient) extent. This would, among other things, open the door to persistence across a temporal gap (see Zimmerman, 1999).
4. Concluding Remarks
Two thumbs up! An impressive debut from Mooney.
ACKNOWLEDGMENTS
We’re grateful to Eric Fossum, Jeonggyu Lee, Tricia Lipscomb (who pointed us to the case of Jasmine Ramirez), John Mak, Justin Mooney, and Teresa Robertson Ishii for helpful discussion of the book. Thanks also to Michael Burke for comments on a previous draft of the review.
REFERENCES
Carmichael, Chad. 2015. Toward a Commonsense Answer to the Special Composition Question. Australasian Journal of Philosophy 93: 475-490.
Rea, Michael C. 1997. Material Constitution: A Reader. Rowman & Littlefield.
Wasserman, Ryan. 2026. Material Constitution. Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
Zimmerman, Dean W. 1999. The Compatibility of Materialism and Survival: The ‘Falling Elevator Model’. Faith and Philosophy 16: 194-212.