Philosophical Manuscripts

David Lewis (1941–2001) was a prolific author. Over his 35-year career, he published four books—Convention, Counterfactuals, On the Plurality of Worlds, and Parts of Classes—and five collections of philosophical papers. He also left behind a substantial Nachlass that illuminates and extends his philosophical legacy. This comes as no surprise to his contemporaries: writing came as easily to Lewis as speaking. And, famously, whether in conferences, classrooms, or one-on-one conversations, Lewis spoke extemporaneously in fully formed paragraphs, ready for transcription. Two large volumes of selected correspondence were published in 2020. And now, in the volume under review, we have a selection of unpublished manuscripts. Whether one has a historical interest in the development of Lewis’s thought or just a philosophical interest in the topics addressed, this attractively edited book will be a valuable resource.

The volume contains two longer manuscripts from early in Lewis’s career and thirty shorter manuscripts that span from 1965 to 2001. Lewis originally had plans to publish the longer manuscripts as books, plans he later abandoned. The first of these longer manuscripts, The Paradoxes of Time Travel, consists of the Gavin David Young Lectures presented at the University of Adelaide in 1971. It was ultimately condensed into the well-known paper of the same title, published in 1976. The second, longer manuscript, Confirmation Theory, was written in conjunction with a course taught at UCLA in 1969 on Probability and Inductive Logic. It was intended not as original work, but as a teaching guide to accompany Carnap’s The Continuum of Inductive Methods (1952), and to present relevant results from the intervening years. The editors have written an engaging and informative “Intellectual Biography of the Young David Lewis” that covers his life prior to his move to Princeton in 1971 and provides context for the genesis of the two manuscripts in question. The shorter manuscripts are on a variety of topics including causation, probability, modality, reference, logic, value, and religion. They include responses to other philosophers’ work, sections written for but omitted from published work, incidental writings distributed to selected faculty and students at Princeton (and beyond), and unfinished papers and outlines of papers written shortly before his death. The editors’ introduction usefully provides a sentence or two on the origin and content of each paper. In some cases, something more substantial would have been useful to provide additional context. But that might have required more sleuthing by the editors than could reasonably be expected.

Lewis introduces his lectures on time travel as follows:

I plan to show that time travel, as imagined in science fiction, is conceptually possible. . . . My purposes are (1) to solve a philosophical problem hitherto largely ignored or casually mis-solved by philosophers. . .(2) to introduce the layman to various topics in metaphysics, since our problem turns out to connect with many more familiar ones; and (3) to show off several of my favorite doctrines and methods in metaphysics.

The “layman” in question would need to be rather astute and philosophically inclined, but the lectures are indeed informal and presuppose no special background. Lewis had considerable success in the 1970s teaching this material to undergraduates at Princeton. The “various topics in metaphysics” connected with the problems of time travel include, of course, personal identity and causation. Lewis ultimately decided that publishing the lectures would not be the best use of his time, choosing instead to let a trilogy of published papers, “Survival and Identity”, “Causation”, and the condensed summary of the lectures, “The Paradoxes of Time Travel”, satisfy the purposes listed above for the philosophical community. (The former is reprinted in Lewis (1983), 55–72; the latter two are reprinted in Lewis (1986), 159–72, 67–80.) The publication of Lewis’s paper on time travel has had a lot to do with the topic no longer being “largely ignored”. Indeed, responses to Lewis’s proposed solution to the Grandfather Paradox pervade philosophy journals to the present day.

One might well wonder whether there is anything in these lectures that adds substantially to Lewis’s published work. The lectures include a lengthier presentation of the four-dimensional metaphysics which Lewis calls the “manifold theory”. And, interestingly, they also include exhaustive timelines and “spatio-temporal maps” for the protagonists’ lifetimes in the two Heinlein stories Lewis took to be models of time travel fiction: “By His Bootstraps” and “—All You Zombies—”. (When I taught time travel, I found this a useful exercise to give to my students.) But what about Lewis’s solution to the Grandfather Paradox? Much critical discussion of Lewis’s views involves considering not just a single attempt to change the past, but repeated attempts. If the time traveler would fail to do something no matter how many times and in however many ways he tried to do it, can it really be said, on the ordinary sense of “can”, that he can do it? If myriad failures to change the past result in myriad strings of coincidences, wouldn’t that amount to a law governing the behavior of time travelers, providing a “chaperone” after all? In the 1976 paper, Lewis says only “a possible world where time travel took place would be a most strange world, different in fundamental ways from the world we think is ours”. One might have hoped that in these expanded lectures Lewis had said something more. Here I think readers will be disappointed.^[1] But on another question, there is substantially new material. After a penultimate section called “Changing the Past: Failure”, which contains Lewis’s well-known solution to the Grandfather Paradox, there is a final section called “Changing the Past: Success”, which contains a discussion of time travel with branching. In “The Paradoxes of Time Travel”, Lewis included only a single final paragraph on branching, and it has sometimes been wondered why he gives it such short shrift. I think the reasons are more aesthetic than metaphysical. Branching time travel is possible and allows for changing the past, but what Lewis called “pure” time travel, time travel within an orthodox four-dimensional manifold, makes for a more interesting time travel story, owing to the additional constraints. In this final section, however, Lewis presents five ways of understanding time travel with branching and considers whether they are genuinely distinct or coherent. For me, this final section on branching provided the most interesting addition to Lewis’s published work.

Lewis introduces his manuscript on confirmation theory as follows:

These notes were prepared for my graduate course on probability and inductive logic at U.C.L.A. in the spring term of 1969. They are still in a very unfinished form. Almost nothing here is new. I have merely attempted a unified presentation of material to be found, in a variety of places. . . .The point of view of these notes is almost exactly that of Carnap in his most recent work on probability.

What Lewis calls “notes” are in fact a very polished formal presentation, complete with theorems and proofs. It begins with background sections on intensional semantics and probability measures. It then discusses rational belief, both static and dynamic, through the lens of Dutch Book arguments. It then considers principles of indifference, and their limitations, as a means of developing additional constraints on rationality. Finally, it considers the alternative approach of starting from our inductive behavior and working backwards to determine rational constraints on initial belief, presenting Carnap’s λ-system and Hintikka’s λ-α-system. A substantial planned chapter on scientific method was never written. Although the manuscript is formal, it is sprinkled with insightful comments that provide motivation for the definitions and theorems.

My first semester as a graduate student at Princeton in fall, 1976 I took a seminar on probability from Richard Jeffrey that Lewis sat in on. At a relevant point in the seminar, Lewis made his manuscript available to the class, informing us that he no longer had plans to publish it. Perhaps that was in part because, over the 1970s, interest in Carnap’s approach to probability and confirmation was already on the decline. (Perhaps, though, it was just a decision to focus on original research; Lewis never did publish any purely pedagogical work.) But over the last twenty years, there’s been an upsurge of interest in “objective” versions of Bayesianism according to which there are substantial a priori constraints on rational initial credence functions. Although recent work seeks to avoid the relativity to language—and, indeed, to artificial formal languages—inherent in Carnap’s approach, the ideas and formal techniques that underlie this approach to confirmation have not lost their relevance.^[2] I think this publication of Lewis’s very clear, self-contained presentation will be of more than just historical interest, at least for specialists in this area.

Interestingly, Lewis maintained an open mind throughout his career to even the most extreme version of objective Bayesianism according to which there is a unique reasonable initial credence function. In this volume, there is a short piece, “Supervenience of Chance” (1979), 161–2, in which he considers three hypotheses as to how chance supervenes on history.^[3] Given Lewis’s commitment to Humean supervenience and acceptance of the Principal Principle, these were the only options. The most ambitious of the three holds that present chances supervene on history up to now, so that “any two rational agents with the same credence distribution over alternative pasts must have the same credence distribution over everything” (161). His conclusion is that, surprisingly, this is the hypothesis that is most tenable: “there is more truth in the ‘project of logical probability’ than seems plausible”. But in the end Lewis promoted a different way to save Humean supervenience from undermining futures: hold that the Principal Principle provides only an approximate constraint on reasonable credence. The pressure to endorse the “project of logical probability” is then dissipated.

Many readers, I suspect, will be primarily interested in the second half of the volume with its thirty miscellaneous short manuscripts on a variety of topics. In all these pieces, whether originally prepared for publication or for presentation at conferences or as notes for students and colleagues, Lewis’s distinctive voice shines through. If like me you want to know what Lewis had to say about anything philosophical, every one of these pieces has something to offer. Here I briefly introduce eight of the manuscripts that I found especially interesting or valuable.

In “Contagion Without Rigidity” (1971), Lewis rejects Saul Kripke’s views on the rigidity of proper names, favoring a sophisticated descriptivism. In this short early critique, Lewis argues that “we ought to take apart Kripke’s package deal”, accepting contagion but rejecting rigidity. Contagion of meaning occurs when the meaning a word has for someone owes to the word being picked up from someone else for whom it has that meaning, together with the intention to use the word with the same meaning as it has for the other. We can have contagion without rigidity. Moreover, Lewis claims, rigidity should be rejected on the grounds that it leads to modal falsehoods. For example, it does not allow for a (de dicto) reading under which identity statements with proper names, such as “Hesperus is Phosphorus”, are contingent.

In “Reply to Davidson” (1972), Lewis addresses Donald Davidson’s views on truth and reference. A Tarski-style truth theory for a language L reduces truth to reference but gives the reference relation as a mere list. Davidson sees this as no objection: we need no general analysis of reference; reference in-L suffices. Lewis agrees that we need no general analysis but claims that one can be had by taking the reference relation to be what fills a certain theoretical role in a Tarski-inspired account of the activity of being truthful (and trusting) in a language, generalizing over languages. An objection to this is the threat of underdetermination. Here Lewis suggests we can appeal to “secondary preferences” beyond being truthful (and trusting). There is no inkling yet that such determinateness might have to come from something external to our preferences, as in his later view invoking naturalness.

In “Counterpart Theory, Mk. II” (1974), Lewis considers four options for revising or extending counterpart theory as presented in “Counterpart Theory and Quantified Modal Logic” (1968) (reprinted in Lewis (1983)). The manuscript, written in Lewis’s inimitable scrawl, was widely circulated during my time at Princeton, 1976–80. A session on the manuscript was held at a conference commemorating the 25th anniversary of the publication of On the Plurality of Worldsat the University of Massachusetts Amherst in 2011. Of the four options, the two he said he was inclined to accept were soon incorporated into his work: “multiple counterpart relations” and “worldless entities”. The two he said he was undecided about were never endorsed. The first of those, “preservation of identities”, involves restricting the variable assignments that are quantified over in giving truth conditions for the sentences of quantified modal logic. For example, if ‘x’ and ‘y’ are assigned the same object, they must be assigned the same counterpart when formulas involving ‘x’ and ‘y’ are evaluated at other worlds, even if the object has more than one counterpart at that world. In this way, Lewis can uphold the necessity of identity, ‘x=y→ • x=y’, and the substitutivity of identicals (for variables) within modal contexts. (This option could still allow for contingent identity statements that invoke multiple counterpart relations such as between a statue and a lump of clay; but oddities such as “I could have been twins” would be ruled out as inconsistent.) This option provides one way to respond to the Kripkean objection that counterpart theory is a threat to logic. But this technical way of responding to the objection is artificial, and Lewis ultimately rejected it. In “Postscript E” to “Counterpart Theory and Quantified Modal Logic” (in Lewis (1983), 45–6), he argues that when one sees how the apparently inconsistent statements are translated into counterpart theory, one sees that there is no violation of logic in what Lewis took to be the fundamental language which is non-modal. The final option Lewis considers is this: instead of taking the accessibility relation between worlds and the counterpart relation between objects to be separate primitives, combine them into a single primitive. After all, both relations are grounded in qualitative similarity, so why not treat the accessibility relation as a counterpart relation between worlds, thus reducing many de dicto modal statements to de re modal statements about possible worlds. (This needn’t involve a full reduction of de dicto to de re because de dicto statements involving logical modality can be analyzed as quantifiers unrestricted by an accessibility relation.) Lewis didn’t endorse this option in his later work, I think for good reason. The sorts of similarity that underlie the accessibility relations that give truth conditions to de dicto statements are unlike the sorts of similarity that underlie the counterpart relations that give truth conditions for de re statements, even when the res in question is an entire world.

In “The Monty Hall Problem” (c. 1982), Lewis provides a sophisticated Bayesian analysis of the Monty Hall problem. Especially noteworthy is the underappreciated result that whether it is rational to switch depends on the contestant’s beliefs about Monty’s policy for choosing what door to open when he has a choice (that is, when the contestant initially picks the right door). If Monty has the policy to always choose the door he in fact chose whenever he has a choice, and the contestant knows this, then the contestant has no reason to switch. In that case, the contestant gets no new evidence when Monty opens the door he does. A lot has been written over the years about the Monty Hall Problem, but I know of nothing better than this short piece.

In “Mass and Value” (1985), a short paper in metaethics, Lewis claims that although there is nothing that fits our naïve theory of value perfectly, there are two different notions of value that fit it well enough. This is analogous to the way that rest mass and relativistic mass fit the Newtonian theory of mass. Lewis sees this as providing a middle ground in metaethics that partly accommodates three different views: naturalism, non-cognitivism or subjectivism, and error theory. We need not, and should not, decide between them.

Lewis’s “Acceptance Speech for the Behrman Award” (1991) is self-reflective and often humorous. Here Lewis shares some of his views on the philosophy of philosophy. This piece is an outlier in the volume, being philosophically lightweight. But in terms of sheer enjoyment, it is worth the price of admission.

“Reply to Cresswell ‘Causation and Semantics’” (1991) is a substantial piece that includes a useful exposition of Lewis’s views on the explanation of behavior in terms of belief and desire. He allows that we ordinarily give explanations in terms of wide content, but argues that such explanations are always underlain by folk explanations in terms of narrow content. He illustrates this with befuddled Pierre taking a bus to London. Especially interesting, I thought, were Lewis’s views about twin earth examples, both their extent (they don’t extend to ‘bus’) and their context dependence.

“Exclusion” (1991) is a section written for, but then omitted from, Lewis’s review of Armstrong’s Combinatorial Theory of Possibility (reprinted in Lewis (1999), 196–214). I found it useful in that it provides a bit more than his published work on his response to the problem of determinates and determinables. If fundamental determinates are simple universals, then they can’t metaphysically exclude one another owing to Lewis’s Humeanism with its rejection of necessary connections. Armstrong’s Humean strategy for explaining such exclusion is to decree that fundamental determinates are structural universals. But, Lewis objects, this would be for philosophy to dictate to science. Instead, we should say that fundamental determinates nomically exclude one another. A solution to the problem of determinates and determinables, then, needs an account of exclusion laws. But exclusion laws are problematic on Armstrong’s account of laws. Lewis gives what he takes to be the best reply within Armstrong’s system to this problem by invoking totality states of affairs. Not that Lewis is in favor of positing totality states of affairs, but if we have them anyway, why not use them for this?

REFERENCES

Beebee, Helen and Fisher ARJ, eds. (2020), Philosophical Letters of David K. Lewis, Volume 1 (Oxford University Press).

Carnap, Rudolf (1952), The Continuum of Inductive Methods (University of Chicago Press).

Lewis, David (1983), Philosophical Papers, Volume I (Oxford University Press).

Lewis, David (1986), Philosophical Papers, Volume II (Oxford University Press).

Lewis, David (1999), Papers in Metaphysics and Epistemology (Cambridge University Press).