While John Bengson, Terence Cuneo and Russ Shafer-Landau (hereafter BCS) don’t put it this way, the basic idea of their new book Philosophical Methodology is, as I read it, to develop a version of what Timothy Williamson (2021) has called ‘anti-exceptionalism’ about philosophy.
A useful way to formulate anti-exceptionalism is in terms of the notion of an epistemologically standard discipline. A discipline (understood as an organized group of individuals collectively interested in a range of topics) is epistemologically standard just in case (a) it has standard epistemological goals regarding its topics; (b) it uses standard methods to achieve those goals (perhaps tailored to suit the topics under discussion); and (c) it has some reasonable expectation of success. From this point of view, anti-exceptionalism about philosophy is the thesis that philosophy is an epistemologically standard discipline.
This thesis isn’t trivial. Many people both in the history of the subject and today deny it or at least appear to. They hold either that philosophy doesn’t have standard goals or doesn’t use standard methods or has no chance of success.
For my part, I am persuaded by anti-exceptionalism; so I find myself sympathetic to the basic thrust of Philosophical Methodology, which is a fantastically clear, thorough, and rewarding book. It contains extensive and valuable discussions of the notion of data and method in philosophy. It connects meta-philosophy to the nature of inquiry, recently the focus of so much interesting work in epistemology. It is very useful in another way too: for those of us who write grant applications and can’t think of what on earth to put in the ‘methodology’ section, the book provides lots of material I will rely on in the future!
Having said that, there are several issues about how best to formulate anti-exceptionalism, and at various points I got the impression that there was a slightly more attractive position in the vicinity of the one BCS were advancing. I will illustrate this by looking at three ideas in the book corresponding to the three properties of an epistemologically standard discipline mentioned above.
To begin with, goals; if philosophy is an epistemologically standard discipline, it has epistemologically standard goals regarding its topics. What then is an epistemologically standard goal? A natural approach explicates this in terms of knowledge. The goal of philosophy is to come to know the answers to philosophical questions.
BCS reject this natural view. For them, the goal of philosophy in the relevant sense is not knowledge but understanding. BCS do not deny it might have other goals too. A discipline considered as a social organization may have many goals, perhaps even inconsistent goals. The point is that understanding is, as they put it (23), the “ultimate, proper goal.”
BCS aren’t alone in saying that understanding is the goal; see, e.g., Beebee 2018, Dellsén, Lawler and Norton 2022, Hannon and Nguyen 2022. But some writers who emphasize this do so in the course of defending exceptionalism rather than anti-exceptionalism. That’s Helen Beebee’s position, for example, as I interpret her, and perhaps also Michael Hannon and James Nguyen’s. But it isn’t BCS’s view. They take understanding to be a standard epistemic goal, comparable to justified belief or knowledge. Moreover, what they say about philosophy is intended to apply to other fields too: the goal of linguistics is to understand linguistics, the goal of archaeology to understand archaeology, etc.
Why then do BCS reject what (we might call) the knowledge view of the goal of philosophy in favour of the understanding view? As I read them, their key consideration is that the goal can’t be “ordinary knowledge”, by which they mean knowledge that at least in principle may be held without fully appreciating its supporting reasons, which may be “congruent with messes and tangles” (25) and which may “incorporate confusion” (25) of various sorts.
I think these points are right, but I also think they call for a clarification of the knowledge view rather than a rejection. Perhaps the goal isn’t ordinary knowledge but systematic knowledge. If you held that version of a knowledge view, you could agree with BCS about ordinary knowledge, but nevertheless have a position that on the surface is different from the understanding view. Alternatively, you might think that, whatever is true on the surface, there is no fundamental difference between the knowledge view and the understanding view; see, e.g., Sliwa 2015, 2017. Perhaps, for example, to understand something just is to have systematic knowledge about it.
Be that as it may, BCS don’t connect understanding and systematic knowledge. They offer a distinctive definition of understanding intended, as I read them, to separate it from knowledge of any sort. On their view (28–9), you understand a subject matter if and only if you fully grasp a theory of that subject matter that has the following properties: it is accurate, reason-based (“positively supported by considerations. . .that speak in favour of its accuracy”), robust (“answering a multitude of questions”), illuminating (“going beyond mere description”), orderly (“exposing. . .systematic connections”), and coherent (“fitting well with a wide range of understanding-providing theories in other domains”). So far as I can see, BCS don’t say what they mean by ‘fully grasp’ but I take them to mean something like ‘be fully competent with’ or ‘be fully acquainted with’, or something of the sort.
That’s an interesting proposal, but I find it too weak in one way and too strong in another.
Here is a reason to think it too weak. Suppose I fully grasp the sense-datum theory considered as a theory about the fundamental nature of perception. Now suppose (contrary to fact, in my view) the sense-datum theory has the six properties just outlined. It doesn’t follow that I understand the nature of perception. That’s because I can fully grasp the sense-datum theory and yet it can be news to me that it has these six features; I may even be convinced that it lacks them. If so, I don’t understand perception. Yet I would understand it on BCS’s proposal since I fully grasp a theory with the relevant properties.
It might be replied that this is not the intended sense of ‘fully grasp.’ But then we need an account of what that is. Moreover, if to fully grasp a theory is to know that it is true (or know that it has the six properties BCS outline), the distinction between the understanding view of the goal of philosophy and the knowledge view begins to blur.
Here is a reason for thinking BCS’s proposal about understanding is too strong. Let us suppose what might actually be true, namely, that Wittgenstein believed that the phenomena of mind and language are not the sort of thing for which you can develop an explanatory theory; and suppose moreover (contrary to fact again in my view!) that he was right. It follows by BCS’s definition that Wittgenstein didn’t understand mind and language. For if he were right about mind and language, there is no theory of mind and language that is both illuminating and orderly in the senses above, and so no theory that has the six properties Philosophical Methodology enumerates. Hence Wittgenstein couldn’t have grasped such a theory and couldn’t understand mind and language. But that is implausible. It is not problematic to say that Wittgenstein didn’t understand mind and language; maybe he didn’t. But it is problematic to say that he didn’t understand mind and language and that he was right about mind and language!
Turning now to methods, if philosophy is an epistemologically standard discipline, it adopts epistemologically standard methods to achieve its goals. What are these methods?
A natural answer is that the methods in question are those recommended by the principles of theoretical rationality, perhaps tailored to this particular case. For example, other things being equal, you should believe according to your evidence; you should coordinate your beliefs with perception; etc.
BCS don’t explicitly discuss this natural answer. Instead, they provide an expert discussion (77ff) of several existing approaches in the literature (e.g., reflective equilibrium and the method of cases) before focusing on their own “tri-level method” for arriving at the goal of philosophy (108). At the first stage, you construct theories that “accommodate and explain the data”; at the second stage, you show that the theories are “substantiated and integrated”; and at the third stage you show them to possess “specific theoretical virtues,” e.g., simplicity or elegance (108).
How does BCS’s answer to the question about method relate to the natural answer just mentioned? Clearly what they say can’t be inconsistent with theoretical rationality. If it were, we’d have no reason to accept it!
Does BCS’s answer differ at all from the natural answer? One potential difference is that their method imposes an order of procedure where the natural answer does not. On closer examination, however, this difference dissolves since BCS accept (as they should) that in practice the order of procedure in the tri-level method can be relaxed (121): “It often makes sense to do some work at level two before trying to complete the job at level one.”
Another potential difference is that BCS’s tri-level method is designed with a particular goal in mind, i.e., understanding in their specific sense, while rational principles are quite general. However, while this may be so, it suggests a somewhat deflationary attitude toward the tri-level method. After all, in the light of the problems just noted for BCS’s notion of understanding, it appears to be just one of the aims of philosophy, not the ultimate, proper aim; hence the tri-level method looks to be a way to apply general principles of theoretical rationality in this restricted circumstance.
Finally, success: if philosophy is an epistemologically standard discipline, it has a reasonable expectation of success in achieving its goals. In effect, the problem of progress in philosophy is the question of whether it has that expectation.
In my own work, I’ve argued that philosophy does indeed have a reasonable expectation of success, in part because, when you understand it properly, you can see it has a reasonable history of success (Stoljar 2017, 2021, 2021a). Crucial to defending this position is a three-way distinction between types of questions, which I call topic questions, big questions, and small questions. Topic questions are those that mark out the rough subject matter of the field. Big questions are questions on these topics but which might differ depending on different epistemic environments, e.g., the mind-body problem as formulated by Descartes. Small questions are particular issues that come up in the course of discussing big questions.
This three-way distinction helps in several ways. First, it allows us to properly identify the issue. It is not controversial that philosophy makes progress on small questions, nor that it fails to do so on topic questions; hence the key question of progress concerns the intermediate category. Second, arguments against philosophical progress often seem successful only because the distinction is ignored. If you conflate topic questions and big questions about those topics, for example, it is easy to infer from the unsurprising fact that the field has not solved its topic questions to the dramatic claim that it has not solved any big questions. Moreover, the big questions at issue in a field change over time in a way that topic questions don’t; hence it is a mistake to infer from the fact that we have not solved the big questions currently under discussion that we have not solved such questions before.
In their discussion of progress, BCS adopt a broadly similar view. The key difference is that they operate with a two-way, rather than a three-way, distinction between fundamental questions, as they call them, and foremost questions (150). But I think this position will need to be modified. For example, some opponents of progress argue that the questions that philosophers are interested in at the moment—foremost questions, in BCS’s terminology—are very small and hence that making progress on them is no real achievement; that would be the complaint, I think, of someone like Philip Kitcher (2012, 2023). To deal with this, BCS will need to distinguish big foremost questions from small ones, but then of course we have the three-way division back again.
To sum up, while the anti-exceptionalism of Philosophical Methodology is attractive, there remains the issue about what sort of anti-exceptionalist to be. BCS describe one sort of anti-exceptionalism, on which (a) the goal is understanding in a special sense, (b) the method is the tri-level method, and (c) progress is defensible if we draw a distinction between foundational and foremost questions. In each case, there seems to me to be a nearby proposal that improves on it.
ACKNOWLEDGMENT
I presented a previous version of these comments at a session on Philosophical Methodology at the Pacific APA meetings in 2023. Many thanks to John Bengson, Terence Cunio, Russ Shafer-Landau and the other participants in the session for helpful reactions.
REFERENCES
Beebee, H. (2018). “Philosophical Scepticism and the Aims of Philosophy.” Proc. of the Aristotelian Society 118 (1): 1-24.
Bengson, J., et al. (2022). Philosophical Methodology: From Data To Theory. Oxford, UK, Oxford University Press.
Dellsén, F., et al. (2022). “Would Disagreement Undermine Progress.” The Journal of Philosophy: 1-33.
Hannon, M. and J. Nguyen (2022). “Understanding Philosophy.” Inquiry: 1-37.
Kitcher, P. (2012). Preludes to Pragmatism: Toward a Reconstruction of Philosophy. Oxford, UK, Oxford University Press.
Kitcher, P. (2023). What’s the Use of Philosophy? Oxford, Oxford University Press.
Sliwa, P. (2015). “Understanding and Knowing.” Proc. of the Aristotelian Society 117: 57-74.
Sliwa, P. (2017). “Moral Understanding as Knowing Right from Wrong.” Ethics 127 (3): 521-552.
Stoljar, D. (2017). Philosophical Progress: In Defence of a Reasonable Optimism. New York, Oxford University Press.
Stoljar, D. (2021). “Philosophy as Synchronic History.” Journal of the American Philosophical Association 7 (2): 155-172.
Stoljar, D. (2021a). “Realism v Equilibrism about Philosophy.” Syzetesis: Revista di Filosofia: 67-88.
Williamson, T. (2021). The Philosophy of Philosophy, 2nd.Ed., Wiley-Blackwell.