This rich collection is the result of a conference on the Symposium held at the Center for Hellenic Studies in August 2005. The essays range from philosophical and classical treatments to discussions of the dialogue's Protean appearances in the law courts, modern poetry, and painting of all eras. Together they show the multifaceted and perennial appeal of Plato's story about a meeting of prominent Athenian thinkers and writers, devoted to the riveting subject of erôs. The array of essays is easier to bask in than to review. One can only hope to offer enough criticism to entice the reader to turn to the volume itself.
The volume starts with Christopher Rowe's "The Symposium as a Socratic Dialogue." More programmatic than detailed, it maintains that the dialogue belongs properly to the category termed early or Socratic dialogues. However, Rowe dismisses Vlastos' distinction according to which Socratic dialogues are marked by the absence of the full blown theory of forms. Since Diotima's description of the beautiful belongs to this theory, according to Vlastos the Symposium is not Socratic. Rather, the distinction that Rowe thinks is relevant is in moral psychology. A Socratic dialogue is one in which it is maintained that all desire is for the good. He quotes, with approval, Anthony Price's assessment of desire in Socrates' speech, "we must take the background assumption to be Socratic: happiness is the ultimate goal of all desire" (11). Unlike Price, Rowe thinks that, in the Symposium, Plato is heavily invested in this moral psychology. Desire in general is "always aimed at what is really good (for us): if anything goes wrong … the culprits will be our beliefs" (11). This claim does not commit Plato to the paradoxical idea that each desire is for the good -- only to the idea that when one acts on a desire one wants thereby to have what is good.
Rowe, in general, holds that Socratic moral psychology is more pervasive in the dialogues and more worthy of serious consideration than previously thought. It is an intriguing view that, if true, would be significant for understanding Plato's moral theory. Still, the present essay raises at least one issue that invites more reflection. Rowe points out that some commentators -- he quotes Nicholas White -- believe that the theory of forms implies a change in Platonic moral psychology. If the good itself is the object of desire, then the object of desire is not just one's own good. Rather, one desires universal good. Rowe objects that "of this good, or Good, there is little sign in the Symposium, which is framed throughout in terms of the "perspectival" good, the good of the agent" (20). Further, he claims that whatever the theory of forms may turn out to mean, Socratic moral psychology will still hold. So the presence of the forms in the Symposium does not change the claim that erôs aims at (one's own) happiness.
It is true that the beautiful is the only form presented as being without perspective -- because it is the only form presented. So it is true that Diotima says nothing about the good itself. Still, the good itself seems to be only a simple implication move away. If the beautiful itself is without perspective, surely the good itself is so as well. Moreover, it is not implausible to think that true virtue, acquired in appropriating the beautiful itself, is importantly different from the virtue acquired lower on the scala amoris -- where the good of the agent is the object of desire. For instance, one might be tempted to think that what counts as one's own good has changed.
In "The Role of the Earlier Speeches in the Symposium: Plato's Endoxic Method?" Frisbee Sheffield takes up the problem of the relation of the earlier speeches with Socrates' final account of erôs. Aristotle uses accepted opinions, endoxa, as the beginning and basis for his inquiries. Is it possible that Plato is doing the same thing in the Symposium? Phaedrus claims that "erôs has the most power when it comes to the acquisition of virtue and happiness" (24). Pausanias' speech builds on this idea but differentiates between harmful and beneficial erôs. "Beneficial erôs privileges the soul over the body" (25). Eryximachus adds to these opinions the idea that "the correct lover must have an expertise" (25). A beneficial, expert erôs needs an account of human nature, which Aristophanes gives in his myth about the sundered self. A consequence of the myth is that erôs attempts to overcome a lack. In Agathon's encomium, Erôs "pursues beauty and induces others to good and beautiful things" (26).
We can see from this catalogue that elements of all these ideas turn up in Socrates' final account. Of course, the previous speakers do not have an adequate grasp of erôs so their opinions need modification and amplification. Still, there is enough continuity to lead one to wonder whether Socrates is using these earlier opinions in somewhat the same way that Aristotle used endoxa. Clearly there is a rhetorical relation between the earlier opinions and Socrates' account. The real question is whether the relation has what it takes to be endoxic. Sheffield offers a useful distinction for approaching the question. Opinions can be endoxic in a weak or in a strong sense. In the weak sense, the speeches "could include useful falsehoods, that is views that are not true, but whose underlying puzzles prompt the inquiry in the relevant direction" (31). In the strong sense, the speeches "not only contain 'nuggets of truth,' but as such they play a role in grounding the course and nature of the inquiry" (31). If the previous opinions were endoxic in the strong sense, Socrates' account would have to answer to them in some way.
Sheffield argues that the speeches before Socrates' are not endoxic in the strong sense. It is true that associating the views expressed before Scorates' speech with prominent speakers suggests that they were current at the time. However, if these opinions were endoxa they would also need to be authoritative; in turn, Socrates should try to preserve as many of them as possible in his final account. There is some evidence in favor of at least two opinions being treated as endoxa. The first is Agathon's idea that erôs desires beauty; the second is Aristophanes' idea that it lacks the thing it desires. Since these ideas are used by Socrates to establish a true account of erôs, he must have accepted them as true. Still, Sheffield's final judgment is that the strong endoxic reading cannot be sustained. First of all, if we take seriously the Platonic distinction between reality and appearance, clearly the other speakers base their views on appearances. Second, Socrates himself undermines their reliability by saying that their "speeches do not aim for truth" (44). As a consequence Socrates "explains some of their most central beliefs about erôs by showing how they can be understood in the light of a certain conception of human nature, and knowledge and so on …" But his account "is not ultimately accountable to them" (44).
The value of Sheffield's essay is in its negative result. Plato does not anticipate Aristotle's endoxic method. If the other speeches are endoxic in the weak sense, then they would seem to be what Charles Kahn calls proleptic. The other symposiasts present problems that Socrates will answer in his part of the dialogue. However, unlike the characters in proleptic dialogues, the other symposiasts do not present their views as aporetic. It is left to the reader to see the problems. But Sheffield's claim that Phaedrus and the rest are all denizens of the world of appearance is suggestive in another way. Perhaps the relation of their views to Socrates' speech is analogous to the relation of appearance to reality. The previous speeches are phenomena in that they express different appearances of erôs whereas Diotima's speech articulates the reality.
In his provocatively entitled "A Platonic Reading of Plato's Symposium," Lloyd Gerson offers an interpretation of the Symposium that we would call neo-Platonist. Of course, they saw themselves only as Platonists. Gerson canvasses several other types of interpretation and criticizes each. First is the position that each dialogue stands alone as a philosophical essay and should be understood in its own terms. Dismissing this approach as a sort of willful ignorance, he turns to the developmental thesis. Even if we grant the basic idea, the developmental thesis has internal problems. The final alternative is Platonism, defined at first negatively, i.e.,
what results if you reject Eleaticism and its implicit nominalism, the materialism of the 'giants' in Sophist, Protagorean epistemological relativism, extreme Heracliteanism, the doctrine that the soul is a harmonia of bodily parts, and the hedonism of the 'subtle thinkers' in Philebus (53).
For the purposes of interpreting the Symposium, the positive doctrine includes the metaphysical distinction between reality and appearance, the 'real' immortality of the soul, and true virtue as complete knowledge of intelligible reality.
Gerson begins with Plotinus' interpretation of the lover in the Symposium. The lover, who is a composite of body and soul, is not immortal. However, part of the soul of the human being -- what he calls the real person -- is immortal. If the soul is really immortal, then we can understand the concept of true virtue. Brought about by ascent to the beautiful itself, true virtue is distinct from the images of virtue, the result of contact with the appearances of beauty. If one takes this distinction seriously -- instead of explaining it away -- it points out the goal of the real person. Real immortality is achieved by transcending the images of beauty and grasping the beautiful itself. "The ascent aims at self-transformation via assimilation to the divine" (58).
Gerson's argument focuses on the passage in which Diotima helps Socrates to see the import of possessing the beautiful by substituting possession of the good. For those who think the forms play no significant role in the dialogue, Diotima's move is within the everyday world of subjects and their properties. Then it becomes hard to see what justification there is for the substitution. Within Platonism, however, the substitution refers to the Idea of the beautiful, which is the attractive aspect of the Idea of the good. Without this identification there is no way to explain the hierarchical ascent in this passage. In a world without these Ideas, all beauty is beautiful; only in a world of Ideas is it possible to differentiate the beautiful objects as Diotima does. Gerson then argues that there "are three principal requirements for keeping beauty and good united within a framework that allows for hierarchical ascent" (61). First, "real immortality is an implicit part of the story" (61). Without real immortality as the goal, the ascent lacks grounding. Second, the love for the beautiful is identical with the desire for the good. But the desire for the good is actually desire for knowledge of the good. Indeed, what one really wants is complete knowledge of the intelligible realm, which is implicit in the knowledge of the good. Third, the ergon of the desire for the good (i.e., the love of beauty) is not the birth in beauty that affords immortality by way of physical children or works of virtue. Rather, the ergon is complete knowledge that makes one divine.
Gerson's brief is that Platonism makes better interpretive sense of a key passage than do the alternatives. One might concede that Platonic metaphysics is needed at this juncture but then wonder whether the whole of Platonism must be found in this dialogue. If we have to find the whole system in this dialogue then we have to treat the text as something like a gnostic cryptogam in which the true meaning is different from the apparent. If the whole point is to achieve real immortality why does Diotima spend so much time explaining substitute immortality? If the beautiful itself is really the good itself -- which is really all intelligible reality -- why doesn't she just say so? These questions may not be unanswerable but they do make more tempting the charms of the developmental thesis.
In "Medicine, Magic, and Religion in Plato's Symposium," Mark McPherran rehabilitates the role of Eryximachus in the dialogue. While the latter's medically inspired speech has been dismissed as self important bombast, McPherran argues we should take it seriously for the way it weaves together medicine, magic, and piety. To begin with, he notes that medicine is a craft that Socrates frequently uses to explain significant philosophical points. Second, it is possible to locate Eryximachus' medical theory within a range of such theories. Hippocratic medicine meant to differentiate itself both from the shamanistic religion of traditional healers and from philosophical theories of medicine. The latter place medicine within a larger account of the whole universe. Eryximachus belongs to the latter group because his account of erôs explains not only health and disease but also harmonies and disharmonies in the universe. However, Eryximachus differentiates himself from Hippocratics in another way. He endorses divination and sacrifices, whereas Hippocratics thought they had no place in a proper medical theory.
McPherran argues, however, that this inclusion of divination and religious practice is of a piece with Plato's program of including but transforming traditional piety within philosophy. Kallipolis, for instance, will have a civic religion, with temples, feasts, prayers, and priests. According to Eryximachus, divination has a role in promoting the harmony between gods and humans. And Diotima's account of Erôs as a daimôn places him in a context where intercourse between gods and humans takes the form of sacrifices and divination. However, McPherran pushes this thesis further by arguing that Eryximachus' notion of piety is something like a precursor to Diotima's final transformation of it. While Eryximachus' piety, like that in the Apology, is based on the correct awareness of the difference between god and humans, in Diotima's speech, piety is transformed in the soul's ascent to the beautiful itself and its assimilation to the divine.
This essay helps us to appreciate the richness of Eryximachus' speech. It is also an antidote to the post-Enlightenment tendency to dismiss Plato's frequent references to traditional religion. Still, we are left to wonder what role Diotima means for sacrifices and divination to play if piety really aims at assimilation to God. Traditionally sacrifices and divination mark the boundary between gods and mortals. Gods do not offer sacrifices to themselves nor read the entrails of animals in order to predict what they will do. Perhaps we have here another version of a central problem in the Symposium. What actually happens to a human being who attains the vision of the beautiful itself?
In "Permanent Beauty and Becoming Happy in Plato's Symposium" we return to the problem of the relation between the good and the beautiful in Diotima's conversation with Socrates. Gabriel Richardson Lear wants to focus on what there is about the beautiful itself that explains its attractiveness and its effectiveness in creativity. After all, the account seems to have all it needs when we know that possessing the good forever is happiness. What role does beauty play in supplying happiness? Of course, others have said that beauty is the attractive aspect of the good. Lear expands on the way beauty is attractive; there is a peculiar link between beauty and immortality. The beautiful itself gives one a glimpse of a beauty that transcends time; in this aspect it is different from a beauty that merely endures the vicissitudes of time. The vision of the beautiful itself, even in its various perceptible manifestations in beautiful things, motivates creativity as a means of satisfying the desire for immortality. She says several times that the form is immortal.
While the form's transcending time somehow feeds the desire for immortality, timelessness is not the same thing as immortality. The beautiful itself is timeless in the sense that the notion of time does not apply to it. This way of talking about the form does not imply that it is immortal. A god is immortal because he does not die; however, a god does not transcend time. Humans may desire to be immortal; they cannot desire to transcend time. It is hard to imagine what it would be like for a human to desire to transcend time since consciousness seems to imply time. So what relation would a glimpse of the beautiful itself, with its timelessness resplendent, bear to the desire for immortality? We need to know more about the timelessness of the form and the desire for immortality. We also need to know how far down this path Diotima's speech can take us.
In "A Study in Violets: Alcibiades in the Symposium," C.D.C. Reeve points out the recurrence of agalmata in Alcibiades' speech. While these are, primarily, statues that represent gods or even humans, in the dialogue we are told about agalmata of virtue inside Socrates himself and in his arguments. However, Socrates points out the ambivalence of the notion. Socrates counters Alcibiades' claim about seeing images of virtue in him with a conditional: "If I have agalmata in me, of the sort that provide knowledge of virtue… ." Reeve argues that Socrates' insistence that he knows nothing about virtue implies that he has no knowledge-bearing agalmata of virtue. If that is what Alcibiades thought he saw, he was wrong.
Still, Socrates does claim a type of knowledge, i.e., of ta erotika. He knows the craft of love. As he says in Lysis, it is a craft that humbles the beloved. Socrates does an analogous humbling in his philosophical elenchus. What he accomplishes thereby is epistemological -- the awareness of ignorance that engenders love of wisdom. This result might suggest that philosophy is just the seeking for wisdom -- a kind of endless Socratic conversation. After all, grasping the form of beauty -- or any other form -- would fill the lack and end the love. However, Reeve holds that, although the forms may be Platonic in provenance, knowing them is not incompatible with philosophy. Knowledge does not imply the end of love of wisdom.
According to Reeve, the one who arrives at the knowledge of beauty works to make sure that the true virtue engendered thereby is passed from one segment of his life to the next. This beauty-inspired work can be turned on the beloved as well. This suggestion about segments of a life seeks to reconcile the philosopher's knowing the beautiful itself with his continuing to love it. The problem is that knowledge of the beautiful itself is not compatible with love of the beautiful if love implies lack and knowledge implies having. One answer would seem to be that knowledge of the form is compatible with an awareness of the possibility of losing it, so that one has a second order desire to maintain the knowledge. This seems to be Reeve's suggestion for reading the desire to possess the beautiful forever. Or perhaps knowledge of the form is direct acquaintance that, for humans, is intermittent so that it requires periodic renewal -- a suggestion found in the next essay.
Ruby Blondell attempts to answer the question in her title, "Where Is Socrates on the 'Ladder of Love'?" The most interesting part of the question is whether he has made it to the last step, a vision of the beautiful itself. Here the evidence could be called indirect. Socrates does not claim to have done so nor does he wax metaphysical in his own voice. Blondell cites behavioral evidence; for instance, his reflective absorption in the doorway could be contemplation of the form. She admits that all such evidence is ambiguous; Socrates could also be standing in the porch having an internal dialogue. Yet she argues that this ambiguity is emblematic of "the unresolved tension … in Plato's work … between achieved (divine) wisdom as a human aspiration and the human condition which prevents us from attaining it" (160).
Still, if Socrates has been guided to the final vision, he must, according to Diotima's account, have passed through all the intervening steps. Blondell, then, canvasses the evidence for placing Socrates at each step. It is not possible to argue for a chronology in Socrates' life. Rather than a development one finds evidence that Socrates occupies each of the steps at one time or another. For instance, Socrates clearly is attracted to handsome young men; so it appears that he is in love with many bodies. Still, the evidence for his occupying each of the steps is more suggestive than compelling. Blondell's general point, however, is that vision of the beautiful itself is not an all-or-nothing experience. She places herself with those who hold that the vision of the form could be intermittent. So Socrates, having seen the beautiful itself, must descend from the heights; the unresolved tension she refers to would be played out in Socrates' continuing to occupy different places on the ladder. This notion does help to make plausible what it would really mean to grasp the beautiful. One is not taken up once and for all into a state of contemplation. Nor does she pass through the ordinary experiences of life enlightened by a beatific consciousness. Like Erôs, Socrates is an intermediary between the divine and the mortal, descending from the vision of the beautiful but returning again.
Beginning at the end, Debra Nails builds her essay, "Tragedy Off-Stage," around Socrates' final comment about the author of tragedy and comedy being the same. The comment has been applied to the author of the Symposium because the dialogue has elements of both. The obvious focus is Alcibiades' speech, which has both a comic and a tragic aspect. But some have identified the tragedy of Alcibiades as subsequent to the dialogue, in his "off-stage" betrayal of Athens. Rejection by Socrates is the leading component of his tragic fate. To see this point we are to imagine that Alcibiades, nurtured by a pederastic Socrates, might have become the greatest statesman Athens ever knew. According to this view, the youth was the victim of a rationally cool Socrates.
While Nails argues against this type of interpretation, she too thinks Alcibiades' fate is an off-stage tragedy; but then so is Socrates' execution. However, the cause of both is "superstition and religious hysteria" (180). In arguing for this rather strong charge, her historical approach to the events surrounding the Symposium tells us much that many readers do not, but should, know. In the events surrounding the expedition to Syracuse, charges of impiety played a significant role. Before the departure of the fleet, the herms were desecrated. Since this act did not bode well for the campaign, the city wanted to purge itself of impiety. Many of the symposiasts were caught up in these events. Slaves and metics accuse Phaedrus and Alcibiades of profaning the mysteries and Eryximachus of desecrating the herms. Phaedrus fled into exile and Alcibiades refused to return for a trial, defecting to the Spartans. Many others suffered even worse fates.
Unless superstition and hysteria are part of the definition of religion, Nails needs to tell us more about Athenian civic religion to sustain her charge. And even if these events rose to the level of the Salem witch trials, it would be hard to make them into a tragedy for Alcibiades. To do so we would have to refigure him as an ambitious but basically well-intentioned young soldier who goes off to Syracuse determined to do his duty. Seeing the religious fanatics back home are planning to offer him up as a sacrifice to their over-wrought sense of piety, he is forced to jump ship. For this account to be a tragedy we would have to view his whole life as broken by religious hysteria. In short, we would have to have a narrative of Alcibiades' life that is dramatically different from the one that he himself gives in the dialogue. His life is broken by his own ambition, the thing Socrates did not or could not address. Even if there was an outbreak of religious zealotry back home, it is only the occasion for his ambitious nature to assert itself.
In "The Virtues of Platonic Love," Gabriele Roxana Carone addresses a nest of problems about Diotima's account of erôs. They center around the tension between the universal and the individual as objects of love. For instance, if erôs is aimed at the universal property of beauty, it is not interested in what is unique in the beloved. Again, if the summit of the ladder of love is the beautiful itself, the particular objects of love seem to be means only to that end.
Carone first defends the idea that the object of erôs is beauty. The import of the idea is to posit beauty as an objective value. Erôs is based on a kind of realism. If Mary is not really beautiful then Tom does not really love her -- no matter what he thinks. The consequence is that Tom can, theoretically, correct himself. Ultimately, beauty is not in the eye of the lover. Of course, one might worry about Tom's treatment of Mary in his quest for real beauty. In answer to this disquietude, Carone responds that perceptual individuals are marked by the compresence of opposites. Since Mary is both beautiful and not beautiful, she will always be loveable somehow. Still, one might object that, since one is attracted to beauty, any beauty will do. Beauty is "intersubstitutable." Carone replies that "the combination of beautiful properties that a particular sample embodies will most likely be unique in each case" (217). So a lover is not thrown into a sea of undifferentiated beauty; he has some reason to prefer one beautiful object over another.
Still, Diotima's extreme realism has another problem. Since the beautiful itself exists apart from other, lesser beautiful objects, it is the true goal of erôs. If so, all the other objects of love seem to be only instrumental, means only to this transcendent end. Carone points out that the one who sees the form begets true virtue. Leaning heavily on the idea of begetting, she claims, without much argument, that the lover must return to the mundane world to do so, like the philosopher in Kallipolis returning to the cave. If so, begetting true virtue needs a love partner. She then argues against the view that Socrates' love of the form excludes his loving individual Alcibiades. According to this view, we can love a form or an individual but not both. Rather, she says, Alcibiades' love of Socrates is flawed because he does not understand the beautiful itself. Socrates, however, guided by this understanding, knows that making love with Alcibiades would not be fulfilling -- precisely because of the latter's lack of understanding. This way of integrating the vision of the beautiful into a practical life of loving is plausible; but it is far from clear that such a life is what Diotima means by 'true virtue'.
In "Agathon, Pausanias, and Diotima in Plato's Symposium: Paiderastia and Philosophia," Luc Brisson analyzes the rather definite practice of paiderastia. The lover, erastês, is an older man, and the beloved, erômenos, is a boy in the bloom of youth -- epitomized by the fuzz that appears on his cheeks. With the first beard, however, the youth is no longer an appropriate object of erôs. While the lover is the active partner, driven by sexual passion, the beloved is not himself sexually active. He grants sexual favors from philia. In exchange, the lover initiates the beloved into male society -- a process that entails a certain kind of education. The practice presents dangers for the boy since being a passive sexual object, as a status, marks social inferiority. Since women and boys are socially inferior, their being sexually passive is expected. As a consequence, an exclusive sexual relationship between men that goes beyond the prescribed age is not what one would expect.
Brisson argues that Diotima presents a radical critique of paiderastia as education. In its place she offers philosophia. The first practice is represented by Agathon and his erastês, Pausanias. Their case is especially significant because their liaison grew into a lifelong partnership. Indeed, such a commitment is a mark of heavenly Erôs in Pausanias' speech. Yet Plato presents its educational benefits as minimal. Since Pausanias justifies paiderastia because it educates the erômenos, Agathon should be a model. However, since his speech is filled with rhetorical flourishes but is really empty, paiderastic education is shown to be fraudulent. What Diotima proposes departs from such a model of education in several ways. The most striking is that the focus shifts to the lover, who articulates an implicit kind of knowledge. Brisson links this pregnancy with reminiscence as it occurs in the Phaedrus. If so, it is the lover who acquires knowledge, along with the beloved, whereas in paiderastia knowledge is transferred from teacher to disciple. Finally, the true object of erôs is not the boy nor is its aim sexual release. Rather the object is the beautiful and its aim is birth in the beautiful, which is true virtue. According to Brisson, the Symposium means not only to transcend paiderastia but to criticize it as well. It is yet another example of bad education in ancient Athens.
In "Female Imagery in Plato," Angela Hobbs begins by addressing some feminist criticism of Diotima's speech. One of the targets is the famous passage which compares birth in beauty to pregnancy. Some commentators have criticized Plato's use of this image -- and others -- because it appropriates and suppresses female functions. Thus it takes away from women their peculiar activities and gives them to men, thereby effacing the peculiarly feminine role in society. Hobbs does not want to dismiss entirely this kind of approach. However, she argues that Plato's use of such female occupations as midwifery, childbirth, and weaving should be put into a larger context. Not only are philosophers represented as engaged in these activities, they are represented as hunters, athletes, and warriors -- all masculine. The upshot is that philosophers are not to be either male or female; at this level, Plato wishes to blur the lines between the genders. And he has good metaphysical reasons for wanting to do so. Gender characterizes the world of becoming. Philosophers belong necessarily to this world; but they are not bound by it. In this vein, Hobbs takes Socrates' gender neutral definition of courage in Meno 73a-c to be a harbinger of this approach, which is fully explicit in Republic V, where differences between male and female guardians are minimized. Finally, of course, the goal of philosophy is to associate with the forms, which she characterizes as genderless. So finally, the philosopher transcends gender. Hobbs leaves us staring an interesting problem in the face, however. If forms are genderless in the sense that they are not in the logical space of gender, then how are we to deal with the sexual imagery of intercourse with the form of the beautiful both in the Symposium and in the Republic (490a-b)?
In "Plato in the Courtroom," Jeffrey Carnes reports on the fate of classical scholarship in philosophy as it appears in recent legal history. The most interesting case considered is Romer v. Evans, in which John Finnis and Martha Nussbaum were expert witnesses on opposing sides, testifying about ancient attitudes and beliefs concerning homosexual love. The case itself was about an amendment to the Colorado constitution that nullified laws which prohibited discrimination against gays and lesbians. Although not a classical scholar, Finnis is an expert in natural law. While this tradition grounds itself in ancient philosophy, it tends to a somewhat ahistorical and theoretical viewpoint. From this viewpoint, Finnis argued that homosexual acts were considered immoral in antiquity. Nussbaum's approach was more textually sensitive; she argued that the record is a lot less absolute than Finnis made it appear. Still, she ran into difficulties because she tried to explain away "virtually every negative reference to same-sex activity in the Greek world" (277). In doing so she made a significant misstep that set off a by now well-known controversy. That aside, Carnes points out the difficulty of marshalling the practice of paiderastia, with its rigid notions of male dominance over the passive partner, as a witness for the defense in this trial. In fact, there was another, deeper problem. The inconclusiveness of academic debate on this, or practically any other topic, is not well suited for the demands of legal decisions -- as the courts soon learned. After this account of the adventures, or misadventures, of Plato in the courtroom, Carnes goes on to detail the other cases, ending with Lawrence v. Texas. In this famous case, the U.S. Supreme Court found that the sexual practices of adult homosexual couples are protected by the Constitution. In this narrative, classicists played no role, but contemporary literary theory did. The decision included the idea that sexuality is socially constructed. Carnes notes the far-from universal acceptance of social construction theories among scholars, leaving us to ponder their use by the bench.
Richard Hunter compares the Symposium with the novel in antiquity, especially Apuleius' Metamorphoses and Petronius' Satyrica. There are two foci in "Plato's Symposium and the Traditions of Ancient Fiction." First is the concern with the status of both the dialogue and the novels as fiction, i.e., with the historicity of the events reported. The novels have a self-reported ambiguous relation to what is called historical or factual truth, as does Apollodorus' narrative of Agathon's banquet. Second, Hunter focuses on the way the Symposium's treatment of erôs is reflected in the novels.
As for the first, Hunter begins with an unobjectionable point. Plato's Symposium aims at philosophical truth, not at an historically accurate account of the speeches given on a particular evening. The point seems to be that lessening the need for literal truth frees one to look for another kind of meaning. But looking for non-literal meaning is, apparently, the introduction of interpretation as a self-conscious enterprise. Hunter then displays for us the brilliance of which this enterprise is capable. Precisely at this point, however, one might see yet another episode in the ancient battle between rhetoric and philosophy.
Clearly the dialogue influenced the novels, as can be seen in parallels, similarities, and even hints. However, Hunter's interpretative strategy allows the influence to run in both directions. For example, while the Socrates of the Symposium influences the Metamorphoses, the latter influences the former as well. This allows Hunter to suggest that the sexual impotence of Apuleius' character Encolpius (similar in some ways to Socrates) tells us something about Plato's Socrates and his failure to penetrate Alcibiades. Socrates "may have left Alcibiades intactus, not because of some high philosophical attitude, but simply because he was impotent." So, the final mystery, revealed by Alcibiades, "turns out to have been of an impotent teacher" (307). We should be able to hear the novelist's mocking laugh directed at Diotima's idealization of erôs. Getting into bed with the most beautiful man in Athens means only one thing; and if that one thing does not happen, there can be only one explanation. And it's not the one the philosophers think it is.
All of this is great fun, of course. And no one wants to appear to miss the point of a skeptical joke. But it does raise the question: is there anything at all on the other side of interpretation? We might reflect on Plato's severe treatment of the poets in Republic X (598a ff). The obvious reading of the passage is that there is a matter of fact in, e.g., medical treatment, which is quite independent of the way it is portrayed by the painter or the poet. It is hard not to think that Plato would say there is a matter of fact about erôs that is independent of the way it is portrayed by novelists -- or their interpreters.
In "Some Notable Afterimages of Plato's Symposium," J.H. Lesher reviews the way the dialogue appears in various artistic genres down through the ages. In fact, most of his examples come from paintings, reproduced in these pages. Painters have concentrated on such aspects as the entrance of Alcibiades, the relation between Socrates and Alcibiades, and the Ladder of Love. Since the reproductions show more than can be said, a mere review cannot offer much except an invitation to look for oneself. One must see Inigo Jones' sketch of the heads of Alcibiades and Socrates to appreciate what struck the artist. Lesher points out that the symposiasts' various accounts of erôs have affected the artistic imagination in different ways, appealing to different conceptions of love. The ways in which the dialogue has been portrayed by artists makes visually fascinating what is, in the reading, intellectually fascinating -- if in different ways.
In "The Hangover of Plato's Symposium in the Italian Renaissance from Bruni (1435) to Castiglione (1528)," Diskin Clay reviews some of the major manifestations of the dialogue in this cultural period. Leonardo Bruni had already translated Plato's Phaedo, Apology, and Crito in his youth; later he turned to Alcibiades' speech. In a translation for Cosimo de' Medici, Bruni sets the tone for handling the theme of erôs between members of the same sex; he simply does not translate those parts of the speech. The seduction scene is transformed to Alcibiades' pursuit of Socrates in search of wisdom. Marsilio Ficino, as might be expected, brings forward a version of the Symposium. He composes an account of a banquet, held to celebrate Plato's birth, in which the dialogue is read; the guests then make speeches on the dialogue -- that is, commentaries on the text. The poet Cristoforo Landino gives an allegorical reading of Aristophanes' speech. The double creatures seem to represent those with a masculine nature, a feminine nature, and a mixture of the two natures. Sexuality does not seem to be the issue. He presents each kind of nature as having been born with an innate and an infused light -- roughly, human intelligence and divine illumination. Once these are sundered, they must be brought together again to attain the vision of God. Pietro Bembo was the son of Bernardo Bembo, known for his Platonic love for Ginerva de' Benci. Her face we know through Leonardo da Vinci's portrait, which can be seen in the National Gallery of Art in Washington, D.C. The son is the author of Gli Asolani, a three day conversation on love, set in the court of the queen of Cyprus. The character Gismondo gives a version of Aristophanes' speech, where only one kind of double creature is presented -- a combination of man and woman. Finally, we have Baldessare Castiglione's Il Cortegiano (The Courtier), the subject of which is the ideal courtier, not love. However, the final speech, given by Pietro Bembo, recalls both the Pheadrus and Symposium. The guiding insight is the role of love in bringing together heaven and earth. At the end of this charming essay we are left with an interesting puzzle: in the Renaissance the Symposium made serious people think of Platonic love, chaste and passionate, while in our era it appears no longer worthy of serious consideration.
David K. O'Connor forges a link between the Symposium and two poets. "Platonic Selves and Shelley and Stevens" considers the roots of the modern fascination with the self. In Alcibiades' speech we find that maddening interval between the actual self and the ideal self. The ascent of the ladder assumes the desire to overcome the interval, even as it posits the means of doing so. In Platonism, this achievement depends on the existence of a transcendent reality. But what happens when one cannot believe that the beautiful itself exists but still wants the ideal self? What results is a kind of exile from the self.
Percy Bysshe Shelley has a direct link with the Symposium. In July of 1818 he translated the dialogue; throughout the rest of his life he returned to the text. According to Mary, her husband resembled Plato in his love of the ideal. In particular, Shelley conceived of the ideal beloved, the "veilèd maid." Not only is she the epitome of all that is loveable, she is also another -- but idealized -- self. Alas, she is veiled because her existence is illusory just at the point where reality is required. The poet's ideal self dissipates when he tries to embrace it. He is left between the deficiencies of his actual self and the unreality of his ideal self, unable to rid himself of either self.
The Romantic vision of a profound want that will never be fulfilled is based on the rejection of a transcendent reality even as it keeps the desire of such a thing. O'Connor finds something analogous in another kind of poet, our contemporary, Wallace Stevens. In our era, the poet oscillates between the brave and lucid existentialist and the equally brave illusionist. The former expresses himself in "The Snow Man," whose imperious and precise vision looks on a world made cold by its underlying nothingness. Here we find the ideal self who has attained the universal viewpoint that concedes nothing to humanity's embarrassing desires. But "Tea at the Palaz of Hoon" is about indulgence in sights and sounds tailored to human dimensions. The poet is aware that this world is his own invention, a self-conscious self-beguilement. He too is caught between two selves, unable to quit either. The link between these themes and Plato can be found in Stevens' reflection on the charioteers' course in the Phaedrus. Finally, O'Connor shows us the Platonic mode of idealization as a tale of what happens if one goes only halfway with Plato's account of erôs.
This volume presents a spectrum of modes of interpretation, as well as a panoply of disciplinary approaches. Yet it manages to keep the ensemble together by what we might call Wittgenstein's rope trick: no strand goes all the way through but they overlap one another to form a whole. One can imagine that the conference from which they came would have been a stimulating exchange of perspectives among talented observers.