In Plato’s Moral Realism, Gerson defends two connected claims: Plato is a metaethical non-naturalist realist, and his ethical realism necessarily depends on his metaphysics. As quickly emerges, Gerson’s Plato is also a Moorean—after a fashion. Just as Moore used his open-question argument to argue that intrinsic value must be sui generis and unanalyzable lest we fall prey to the naturalistic fallacy, so Plato—on Gerson’s reading—believes the Idea of the Good must have no essential content (it must be “beyond essence”, as Gerson translates ἐπέκεινα τῆς οὐσίας (Republic 509b9)), or else we can always ask why any of its essential properties (or the instantiations of those properties in the world) are themselves good. We might think of Gerson’s Plato as aiming to avoid an essentialistic fallacy—and this Platonic version of the open-question argument serves as an argumentative refrain throughout the book (e.g., 16-19, 33, 49, 66-67, 90, 96, 130, 143, 156, 170, 173, 182). Often explicitly associated with Moore, the argument provides key motivation for Gerson’s central theses: Plato’s superordinate Idea of the Good has no essence, and only such a sui generis metaphysical entity can adequately ground Plato’s normative theory.
After establishing his metaphysical framework at the start of Chapter 2, Gerson draws out its consequences: the identification of the Good with the One means I more fully instantiate the Good the more I realize integrative unity in my life (Chapter 2); the knowledge necessary and sufficient for virtue is a grasp of the Idea of the Good (Chapter 3); that the knowledge relevant to virtuous activity is rooted in Plato’s metaphysics shows the normative theory of the ‘so-called’ early Socratic dialogues is not eudaimonist/prudentialist (Chapter 4); wrongdoing occurs when I fail to act in accordance with my recognition of the Idea of the Good’s normative authority (Chapter 5); the Philebus and Statesman show how the concept of integrative unity provides a contentful normative theory (Chapter 6); and all this has important results for our understanding of Plato’s theology and political philosophy (Chapter 7).
My brief survey risks masking the richness of Gerson’s work, which touches on a staggering array of debates in contemporary Plato scholarship. Given a project this daring—Gerson aims to upend the widely-held assumption that Platonic (and, distinctly, Socratic) ethics can be understood independent of Plato’s metaphysics—it is hardly surprising that some choices in presentation and argument invite objection.
It is often difficult, for instance, to distinguish when Gerson believes he is reconstructing Plato’s own positions using direct textual evidence from when he is ‘filling in the gaps’ in Plato’s theory, whether on the basis of later Neo-Platonism or his own philosophical intuitions. Gerson also makes a number of bold claims without offering the kind of sustained defense one might hope for. For example, Gerson claims that for anyone who believes “the source of all being is no guide to the attainment of the good for human beings…the only possible guide to that which is really good is how that appears to each one” (45)—a striking reductio, but hardly supported by the argument he provides.
Furthermore, when engaging with other perspectives in the secondary literature, Gerson sometimes mistakes the point in dispute. A key example is his engagement with defenders of Socratic eudaimonism (which Gerson calls ‘prudentialism’) in §4.2. Gerson claims that prudentialism reduces to “a probabilistic argument in defense of Socrates” (129); that is, eudaimonist arguments for the life of virtue reduce to virtue being the most likely/reliable way to ensure one’s happiness. However, when scholars like Irwin claim Plato is a rational eudaimonist, they are fundamentally interested not in how we determine whether I have reason to perform this or that action (prudentialist deliberative frameworks might, but need not, involve probabilistic reasoning), but rather in what grounds my reasons (answer: my own good, rather than the Good). By insisting on the non-universal nature of practical maxims derived from probabilistic calculations, Gerson fails to engage with the more fundamental question of the structure of practical reasons—and his criticisms of prudentialist readings miss their mark.
However, because I believe Gerson’s underlying theses are true—Plato is a metaethical non-naturalist realist, and we isolate his normative theory from his metaphysics at our interpretive peril—I want to focus on how Gerson chooses to defend them, namely, by presenting Plato as a Moorean (of a sort) avant la lettre. I have my hesitations about attributing Moore’s open-question argument to Plato some two millennia before Moore, but let us grant that Plato has such an argument available to him and that it structures his conception of the Good throughout the dialogues. We should then ask why, when facing the same theoretical choice points, Gerson’s Moorean Plato opts for such different paths from Moore—which will in turn draw our attention to several key challenges for Gerson’s interpretation.
Moore was an intuitionist, believing we identify intrinsic goodness by employing our innate intuition in conjunction with the Principia’s method of isolation. Importantly, this intuitionism allows us to preserve the unanalyzable character of intrinsic goodness (and thereby avoid the naturalistic fallacy) while still making evaluative determinations.
I found it surprising that Gerson says nothing about the Philebus’ method of isolation (see e.g., 20e-22b) in his chapter on the Philebus and Statesman, especially given the dialogue’s importance for Moore’s own project. More surprising still, while Gerson believes Plato endorses a form of Moorean intuitionism (our vague knowledge of the Good is a “permanent endowment in rational creatures” (166 n.43)), he does not appeal to this intuitionism as the ultimate justification for first-order normative claims. Instead, Gerson attributes several seemingly-essentialist properties to the Idea of the Good, for instance, that it is one, and claims these generate “criteria” or “heuristics” by which we can determine whether the Good is instantiated (43).
Gerson believes that saying “the Good is the One”, or that integrative unity is an ‘index’, ‘criterion’, or ‘heuristic’ for the Good, is different from claiming that “the Form of Justice is part of the Good”. The latter, Gerson claims, is an unacceptable essential predication vulnerable to open-question style objections, whereas the former preserves the essence-less character of the Idea of the Good. It was not at all clear to me by the end of the book that Gerson had earned this distinction—and if he has not, then I find it puzzling why his Plato appeals to such heuristics and identity statements, thereby at least appearing to commit the essentialistic fallacy, when he might instead appeal (like Moore) to direct applications of our valuative intuitions.
Moore also takes the primitive ‘object’ in his axiology to be a form of value—intrinsic value itself is sui generis and unanalyzable. Moore believes the open-question argument applies to what he calls ‘metaphysical ethics’ (turning on non-natural metaphysical objects like Platonic Forms) just as much as to natural properties, because we can still ask why instantiating the Form of the Good is itself good. Of course, this theoretical decision comes with costs—Moore is infamously vague about intrinsic value’s ontological status and chary of questions about its source. Gerson’s Plato, on the other hand, does not take his unanalyzable primitive to be value itself, but rather the source of value. As Gerson repeatedly emphasizes, the Idea of the Good is not itself good, but the source of all goodness (224). This contrast between Moore and Gerson’s Plato raises two issues.
First, it is ultimately unclear how value enters Gerson’s picture. Drawing on Proclus, Gerson distinguishes between the co-ordinate Form of the Good (the genus of all perfections) and the super-ordinate Idea of the Good (the source of all value). When I say that, for instance, ‘justice is good’, I can mean two things: that justice perfects human beings and so participates in the Form of the Good; and that justice is, for human beings, a kind-relative form of integrative unity and thereby a way of instantiating (however imperfectly) the Idea of the Good. Participating in the Form of the Good by being just is a form of self-perfection; instantiating the Idea of the Good by being just (which is, for humans, a form of integrative unity) is good simpliciter and therefore, Gerson’s Plato argues, necessarily also good for me. Gerson believes the former claim is vulnerable to open-question challenges (why is self-perfection good for me?), but the latter is not. Yet it seems to me that these two claims should stand or fall together: I see no principled reason why instantiating the essence-less Idea of the Good through my kind-relative integrative unity is any further removed from the essentialistic fallacy than participating in the Form of the Good by realizing kind-relative perfections. In both cases, we are left asking why such relations are valuable—and merely asserting that the Idea of the Good is the source of value (though not essentially!) cannot resolve this worry.
This raises a second Moorean challenge for Gerson’s account. Precisely because he thought non-natural, metaphysical grounds of value were equally susceptible to naturalistic fallacy-esque objections, Moore deliberately constructed his ethics to be independent of metaphysics: to get his normative theory off the ground, he thought it only necessary to posit an unanalyzable form of value that was intuitively accessible. That Moore built his ethics on such metaphysically-abstemious grounds challenges the stronger of Gerson’s interpretive claims about the relationship between metaphysics and ethics in Plato’s thought, namely, that Plato’s normative theory not only depends on his metaphysics as a matter of historical fact, but that such metaphysical dependence was philosophically necessary—there being no other way, Gerson claims, to construct a robust realist metaethics to undergird the normative theory we find in the dialogues. Couldn’t Plato, like Moore, construct his normative theory by a similar route, avoiding appeal to his metaphysics? He may not in fact have done so—but that does not license Gerson’s bolder claim of theoretical necessity (Gerson calls the Moorean solution “untenable” early in the book (11n.33), but by the end, it was unclear whether his objection amounted to anything more than a question of philosophical taste).
Finally, Moore builds a consequentialist normative theory on the back of his metaethical non-naturalist realism: what makes an action right is that it promotes intrinsic goodness in the world, and our notion of agent-relative value is reducible on analysis to whatever agent-neutral value is found in a particular life. Gerson’s Plato endorses many of consequentialism’s hallmarks (for instance, that the good is prior to the right (§1.4)) and identifies the good-for-me with the Good, but Gerson nevertheless insists that “Plato’s moral realism is unalterably opposed to utilitarianism” (226). His motivating worry is that consequentialist theories (and Gerson here uses ‘utilitarianism’ and ‘consequentialism’ interchangeably) eliminate all universal moral laws except for a principle of maximization, which may require me to sacrifice my own good or harm others for the sake of maximizing overall goodness—both possibilities that Gerson’s Plato would emphatically reject.
This rejection is justified by appeal to the Idea of the Good’s superordinate character, which ensures my good is identical with the Good and consequently will never require my harming others—and Gerson explicitly contends that for Plato “the identity of ‘good’ and ‘good for me’ does not support consequentialism” (19n.51). However, he provides no clear means of resisting Moore’s consequentialist conclusions. Insofar as I aim to ensure (perhaps maximize?) the Idea of the Good’s instantiation in the world and this instantiation is identified with my good, I see no reason to prefer that I instantiate it in my own life rather than the lives of others. The result is ironic: in making Plato a Moorean, Gerson may also have inadvertently made him a utilitarian (insofar as my interest in the Good’s instantiation should not prioritize its instantiation in my life alone)—or, in what would represent an equally repellant conclusion for Gerson, a prudentialist (because the only justification for prioritizing the achievement of my own integrative unity would seem to be pragmatic/probabilistic, insofar as my good is the good I can most effectively or reliably achieve).
All this is not to detract from the accomplishments of Plato’s Moral Realism. Gerson’s magisterial grasp of the ancient commentary tradition and contemporary scholarship is on constant display, and the book serves as a clarion call to re-evaluate our understanding of the relationship between Plato’s ethics and metaphysics. Even if one ultimately decides Plato is no Moorean, Gerson’s arguments deserve careful attention.