Plato’s Laws is a wide-ranging and complex work of political philosophy, and recognition of its significance has been on the rise in recent decades. Matching it in richness, range, and complexity, André Laks’s Plato’s Second Republic: An Essay on the Laws guides the reader through the Laws’ thinking on the work’s overarching concerns. Chapter 1 provides an initial roadmap to the Laws. Chapters 2–3 argue that the relationship of the Republic’s best city and the best city of the Laws to the constitution finally elaborated in the Laws is a relationship of paradigm to approximations of the paradigm. What is to be approximated is the divine rule of reason (as Laks translates nous). It turns out that even very close approximations may not look very much like their paradigms so that, for example, the holist and particularist judgment of the political expert may be most closely approximated by the commands of exceptionless and changeless laws. Chapter 4 outlines the moral psychology that informs the Laws’ legislative proposals (including both the ‘constitutional law’ that sets up offices and institutions and the laws addressed to office-holders and others under the constitution), taking special account of the nature of pleasure, which human beings take in the familiar as well as in the ordered and fine. These pleasures determine both the limits to, and the potentiality for, human inculcation into virtue. Chapters 5–6 discuss the relationship between legislation’s aim of complete virtue and legislation’s various targets, such as freedom, friendship, and equality; and what it is to ‘mix’ and what is ‘mixed’ in constitutional design and why. Chapters 7–9 focus on the tension between the rational content of law and its tyrannical form (command followed by threat for noncompliance) and Plato’s innovation of legislative preambles to address this tension. Chapter 10 reflects on the sense in which the constitution described in the Laws itself is ‘the truest tragedy’: transgressions are followed by punishments, and legislative violence is unavoidable. Three appendices round out the book. Appendix A argues that the Statesman is transitional between the Republic and Laws as providing the ‘conceptual ground’ for what is ‘the all-things-considered consequence of an anthropological turn made possible by the logic of the paradigm itself’ (161). Appendix B argues that the main shift in Plato’s moral psychology between the Republic and the Laws is a cleaner break between the rational and the irrational in the latter compared to the former. Appendix C comments that Posidonius’ criticism that Plato’s institution of preambles is pointless, given that the command form of the law demands obedience, not understanding (reported in Seneca’s Letter 94), thus it ‘neglects the problem that Plato meant to solve. . . .For it is because law “orders and does not discuss” that Plato’s lawgiver must take on himself the “discussion” which the law is unable to conduct’ (179).
In what follows I will focus on only three of the items on this rich menu: (1) the moral psychology of the Laws and its implications for Laks’s thesis that the relationship of the constitution of Kallipolis in the Republic to the constitution of Magnesia in the Laws is one of paradigm to approximation; (2) the relationship in the Laws between the constitutional targets of freedom and equality, on the one hand, and legislation’s aim of citizen virtue, on the other; and (3) how the persuasion provided by preambles to the law relates to citizens’ reasoning.
To begin the discussion of moral psychology: the Laws’ main speaker, the Athenian, describes human beings as wind-up toys pulled by two kinds of cords, hard iron cords representing the passions and a golden cord representing calculation (Frede, 2010). The latter is divine, soft, and gentle rather than forceful, needing helpers to overcome the former kind when they pull against it (644e–45a). Chapter 4, “Human Nature” unpacks this metaphor and in light of it the program of education in the Laws. Unfortunately, Laks’s description of these motivations as ‘solitary and fragile’ and the primary passions and derivative psychic states as ‘taken collectively as hard as iron’ (67) overlooks the Athenian’s characterization of calculation’s pull as not only gentle but also soft (malakēn, 645a3). Softness could represent not only calculation’s need for helpers, but also its flexibility, in being able to change direction easily, like gold, and might point towards its ability to recruit some of the hard iron cords against others, so that ultimately what we do is what calculation calculates we should do. The Athenian illustrates how the golden cord can win this tug of war: the public acceptance of law makes the prospect of violation arouse prospective shame (aidōs) in the would-be violator (646e–47d). So, for example, I may be tempted to cheat, but what keeps me from cheating is not only calculation (it’s bad for the community; I face the risk of detection and punishment) but also the painful prospect of my peers thinking less of me.[1] I can use this law-created resource in support of my reasoned conviction that I should not cheat. This is an example of how reason, although weak, can function as a clever manager of our other motivations, so that even though each of them (being iron) has a stronger pull than calculation does, when some of them pull against others and on calculation’s side, it can control what we do.
This missed opportunity notwithstanding, Chapter 4 gives a nicely balanced account of the role of pleasure in both our accordance with and contrariety to reason: we find pleasure in order on the one hand and in what is familiar-to-ourselves on the other. The human potential for near-divinity and gentleness on the one hand and wildness on the other is rooted in pleasure and pain’s being the more powerful motivators in our lives. Education must lead our capacity for pleasure-in-order to ever-higher pleasures and counter our tendency to find pleasure in the familiar, since at least some of what is familiar can be bad. Laks’s account grows vague when it comes to ‘the difficulties that await the program of translating the in-born pleasure for order to the extra-kinetic and extra-melodic sphere of linguistic statements and opinions, as the heterogeneity of pleasure and rational order progressively take precedent over the primitive hints at their association’ (71). Here Laks might have explored Laws 10’s identification of our different cognitive states with different kinds of motions (896e–97a).
In Appendix B Laks argues that, contrary to the argument of Christopher Bobonich’s (2002) Plato’s Utopia Recast, there is no major shift from a tripartite psychology of agent-like soul-parts in the Republic to a unitary soul possessing both the power of reasoning and irrational motivations in the Laws. Rather, the sentences in the Republic that suggest agent-like soul-parts are ‘metaphorical’ and seem to suggest that the soul-parts have independent powers of belief-formation only because they ‘represent’ classes of citizens (173); as a matter of psychological doctrine the soul of the Republic is no less unitary than the soul of the Laws. But this is too quick: the city-soul analogy is, like all analogies, limited, and the fact that the soul-parts ‘represent’ classes of citizens does not, for example, lead Plato to assign the appetitive part a productive function. So the question remains: why does he assign it beliefs? On the other hand, if soul-parts’ agent-likeness is ‘metaphorical’, rather than a side-effect of representing classes of citizens, then the reader is owed an account of the point of the metaphor.
Laks maintains that the difference in moral psychology between the Republic and the Laws has to do with a cleaner break between the rational and the nonrational in the latter: ‘In the Republic, the thumos is the ally of the logistikon, which it helps in controlling the appetitive part; in the Laws, the thumos is clearly used in the sense of ‘anger’ (hence the question about whether it is a part or a passion associated with fear), and it is against this relatively homogeneous whole that reasoning and its upshot (the belief about what is best) must impose itself’ (176).
But what is always on the side of reason in the Republic is not thumos (anger) but the thumoeides (literally something anger-like in form, often translated ‘spirited’). This non-inconsistency may be supplemented by a similarity: in the Republic the thumoeides part is responsible for shame or anger directed at oneself for failing to live up to one’s judgment of what one should do (439e–40b); in the Laws the species of fear that pulls on the side of the golden cord of calculation is prospective shame (aidōs). But how can the Athenian count on shame to pull on the side of calculation unless, like the Republic’s thumoeides, and for that matter the Phaedrus’ good horse, it is always on the side of judgment (doxa)? Of course, one’s judgment might be formed either through calculation or through bodily pleasure/pain, and this is where both dialogues bring in the distinction between rational and irrational. The presence or absence of motivations that naturally follow doxa is no part of that distinction —after all the pleasures in order also do that, even on Laks’s own account.
The moral psychology of the Republic as compared to the Laws matters to Laks insofar as he wants to show that Plato need have had no radical change of mind about the corruptibility of human nature, emphasized in the Laws but not the Republic, because the relationship between the two dialogues is one of paradigm to approximation. Thus Laks takes the Athenian’s declaration that they are legislating for human beings, not gods and heroes, and that it’s not possible for a human being (setting aside gods and heroes) to combine political expertise and unaccountable power for a long time (46–47, Laks’s emphases) not as walking back the possibility of the Republic’s best city, but rather as complementing it. After all, the Republic only claims that if philosopher-rulers could come to be (which is not impossible), then the best city could be approximated, which Laks maintains, is a second ‘sense’ of ‘possible’, distinct from ‘could come to be’. Both dialogues can maintain that pleasure renders human beings corruptible so that the best city may at most be approximated when set up for human beings.
Attractive as the paradigm-approximation account is, one wonders: if the Republic’s best city is a paradigm that doesn’t yet take human nature into account, why is it necessary for it to impose restrictions on private property ownership for the guardians (416c–17b, 420a,421e–22a)? Why is it necessary to conceal biological relationships and the principles for determining marriages (459c–61e)?
Further, the alleged evidence for a second ‘sense’ of ‘possible’ in the Republic is Socrates’ saying, in Laks’s translation, ‘if we’re able to discover how a city could come to be governed in a way that most closely approximates our description, let’s say that we’ve found the things that you have ordered us to show are possible’ (473a5–b1) (39). Does ‘let’s say’ warrant a new ‘sense’ of ‘possible’? Why not just a relaxation of standards for Socrates’ demonstration that the city he’s described could come to be?
The second topic I will discuss is Laks’s account of how, if education aims to promote citizen virtue, this aim is related to the many targets of legislation mentioned in Laws 3, not only wisdom and temperance but also friendship and freedom. Freedom is especially puzzling because the Athenian says that Sparta achieved it as a result of power-sharing in its institutions (two kings and an ephorate representing the people) and the freedom it achieved thereby was freedom from domination by Persia. But how is this related to civic freedom? The Athenian switches from Sparta to Persia and Athens, which in their best moments represent the ‘duly measured’ constitution. In Persia, despotism was tempered by Darius allowing his generals to exercise some judgment; in Athens, freedom was tempered by respect for authority under the ancient constitution. Although Laks closes Chapter 5 with a lot of unanswered questions not only about the historical narrative in Laws 3 but also about the inclusion of freedom as a constitutional target in Laws 6, in Chapter 6, on mixture, he explains how the principles of monarchy and democracy are ‘blended’ via the institutions of the Laws’ constitution, and how freedom acquires its positive meaning (not just freedom from some master, derived from non-slave status, but also freedom in being reason-ruled since reason is something internal and hence servitude to it is voluntary) via the obligations and hence normative implications of the social status ‘free’.
This is interesting (if somewhat distant from the text), and I wondered about the relationship between ‘internal’, ‘voluntary’, and ‘free’. It is odd to think that an inclination’s being internal would be sufficient for acting on it to be voluntary—eros’s tyrannizing and forcing is only the most famous counterexample, but the Athenian also takes badness and injustice, which seem internal enough, to be involuntary (860d). Finally, the movement from an allegedly ‘negative’ freedom consisting in non-slave status, to an allegedly ‘positive’ freedom consisting in rule by reason, is questionable. From the fact that slaves were by definition not free and citizens were not slaves, it does not follow that the ‘sense’ of ‘free’ was ‘non-slave’.
Turning now to freedom and equality: Laks distinguishes these only as monadic and relational conditions of civic friendship. But does civic friendship require some compromise between freedom and authority, and so some kind of equality (perhaps because of the actual corruptibility of rulers with absolute power or the perceived/imagined concern of the ruled with exploitation by too-powerful rulers)? Perhaps, rather than differing as monadic and relational, freedom is a condition that demands recognition and equality a way of recognizing it (e.g., by lot vs. by proportional equality).
My final topic is Laks’s discussion of the institution of persuasive preambles to law by which Plato addresses the ‘tyrannical’ form of law (command accompanied by threat of sanction for violation). Laks finds this form to be ‘irrational and apolitical’ because of its use of ‘constraint and ‘violence’ (bia)’ (107). But although Laks connects persuasion with a legitimate request from the ruled (117), it is never really clear what the preamble is supposed to persuade the listener of. Is it that he should obey the law? Or that the law is good (individually? collectively?) or just? Or that it expresses what he would want anyway? Is ‘anyway’ to be cashed out as ‘if he were fully rational’? Laks avoids some of these questions by characterizing the scholarly debate about whether the persuasion of the preambles is ‘rational’ or ‘irrational’ as ‘rather confused’ (125). Instead, he constructs a scale on which to place the various preambles, one extreme of which is philosophical dialogue or teaching (123), for example in Laws 10’s preamble to convince the atheist of the existence, care, and incorruptibility of the gods (146), and on the other extreme, threat of punishment reintroduced within the preamble itself, for example in the preambles to crimes of impiety like kin-killing and temple robbery (133–35).
But it is interesting that the threatening preambles contain not just threat (of afterlife punishment in addition to human punishment) but also another perspective on the wrongdoer—it is not he but an alien desire implanted in him that drives him to wrongdoing—and advice on how to act on this other perspective—he should betake himself to the shrines of curse-lifting gods and the company of good men (9.854a–c). Philosophical dialogue this is certainly not, but does it not alert the wrongdoer to the resources of his own reasoning, that golden cord that can enlist other motivations to its side?
This review has, as is the way of reviews, focused on disagreements and alternatives. But I should close by acknowledging that I’ve only scratched the surface of an unusually rich and thought-provoking book. Laks has engaged deeply with Plato’s Laws and his book deserves close and careful study.
REFERENCES
Dorothea Frede, ‘Puppets on Strings, Moral Psychology in the Laws’, pp. 108–26 in Bobonich (ed.) Plato’s Laws: A Critical Guide, Cambridge 2010.
Susan Sauvé Meyer, ‘Pleasure, Pain and “Anticipation” in Plato’s Laws, Book I’ pp. 311–28 in Presocratics and Plato: Festschrift in Honor of Charles Kahn, Patterson et al. (eds.) Parmenides Publishing 2012.