In the Timaeus, Plato famously characterised time as ‘an image of eternity moving according to number’. The former is a derivative, partial reflection of the latter. It is not the case that eternity is simply an absence of the former, as the word ‘timelessness’ might suggest. Eternity is, in fact, ontologically prior to time, and we really understand the latter only by understanding the paradigm of which it is an image.
Now suppose the familiar motion of the bird flying past my window stands in the same relation to a kind of ontologically prior “motion” that is non-spatial and incorporeal. Perhaps such motion is partly constitutive of the life of soul and intellect—forms of life that enliven our familiar world of visible and tangible particulars. On such a view, Wallace Stevens’ third stanza about a blackbird’s motion was correct: ‘it was a small part of a pantomime’.
This is the world of late antique Platonism, where what empiricists regard as the realities most firmly grasped by human beings are mere images of incorporeal being grasped by the mind alone. Marinescu’s is the first book-length treatment of the various orders of motion in Neoplatonism since Stephen Gersh’s Kinêsis Akinêtos: A study of Spiritual Motion in the Philosophy of Proclus published over fifty years ago. In my judgement, Marinescu’s book is excellent, and I learned a lot from it. (You can too: it is open access from CUP, so money is no obstacle to enlightenment!)
More specifically, Marinescu’s book is essential reading for anyone working on philosophy in late antiquity for at least two reasons. First, it brings new evidence to one of the most controversial questions in late antique Platonism: to what extent and in what ways were various Platonist authors committed to the doctrine of a harmony between Aristotle and Plato? Marinescu’s book is a case study of a particularly thorny issue for harmonists: the nature of motion. It’s a thorny issue because Neoplatonist authors accepted what Gersh called ‘spiritual motion’ and what Marinescu more accurately calls ‘non-physical motion’—‘motion related to the incorporeal and non-spatial intelligible realm’ (19). But Aristotle rejects the idea that things lacking parts could be correctly said to be in motion. Aristotle also seemingly rejects Plato’s notion that the first principle of motion is self-moving in favour of a first principle that is immoveable. Among the late antique Platonists, the Athenian Proclus is Marinescu’s principal subject. He effectively contrasts him with other Platonists associated more strongly with the Platonist school at Alexandria, like Ammonius and Simplicius. Proclus is generally polite and deferential toward Aristotle, but on Marinescu’s reading, he was no harmonizer: Plato and Aristotle are genuinely at odds on many issues, and where that is the case, Proclus is perfectly willing to say Aristotle is almost always wrong.
The second reason that this book is essential reading for scholars of late antique Platonism is that Marinescu makes part of his case by means of a careful examination of one of Proclus’ least known works—the Elements of Physics (hereafter EP). Thus, his book provides those of us who haven’t spent enough time reading Proclus’ EP (and I suspect I’m not the only person who is guilty of this!) with an extremely valuable overview of its structure, content and purpose. EP resembles Proclus’ best-known work—his Elements of Theology (hereafter ET)—though EP is only one fourth ET’s size. Both employ an axiomatic method where propositions are numbered and proved. But while ET is not an interpretation of any particular Platonic dialogue, EP provides an axiomatic exegesis of specific books of Aristotle’s Physics and De Caelo.
Marinescu’s book has a suitably Platonic structure, beginning from what is more familiar to us by the senses before arising to the level of psychic and intellectual motion. In Chapter 1, Marinescu pursues Proclus’ account of physical motion and the subtle deviations from Aristotle’s theory of motion in EP. Chapter 1 includes an analysis of EP’s 1) purpose and exegetical background, 2) content, and 3) form and method. With respect to 1), Marinescu argues that it was intended as an introductory work and that Proclus circumvents those contentious issues about Aristotle that he discusses more fully in more advanced works like his Timaeus Commentary.
With respect to 2) content, it establishes propositions argued for in Physics VI and VIII (but not Book VII) and treats these as continuous with material from De Caelo (DC) Book I. Putting this content into a single work testifies to the Neoplatonists’ conviction that the Physics VIII argument for the prime mover is compatible with the explanation of the heavens’ circular motion in DC. (In the latter, Aristotle introduces the fifth element, the aether, whose natural motion is circular and eternal, and some modern commentators wonder how this fits with the causality of the unmoved mover of Physics VIII.) Marinescu also attends to what Proclus does not include in the content of EP. For instance, Proclus omits the chapters in DC where Aristotle argues that the cosmos is ungenerated and indestructible since some of that argument is directed against what Aristotle took to be Plato’s view. Proclus derided this silly misreading of Plato (as he supposed) in his Timaeus Commentary, and Marinescu points out just how rudely he did it (39-40). By contrast, Simplicius sought to harmonise the two philosophers, arguing that Aristotle’s objections in DC were deliberately directed at the silly, literalist reading—a reading that Aristotle did not in fact share, but which was a common misunderstanding of Plato (in DC 296.26–30).
With respect to 3), form and method, Marinescu adds a new insight. Previous commentators have noted that Aristotle’s own presentation in Phys VI and VIII, as well as DC I, is very pithy in its argument. In addition, there is the familiar observation that Proclus’ presentation in both Elements is comparable in some ways to Euclid’s Elements. Marinescu, however, makes a case that Proclus’ text implements ideals for the presentation of a science set out in Posterior Analytics. The details of the argument from pages 44-65 are not easily summarized in a review, but I think it will be of interest not only to people who work on Proclus but to those interested in Aristotle’s philosophy of science.
In Chapter 2, Marinescu turns to a specific point of contention between Aristotle and Plato. The latter treats the self-moving soul as an ultimate source of motion within the cosmos, while Aristotle insists instead on an unmoved mover. Middle Platonism finds some degree of agreement by treating the Demiurge of the Timaeus as an intellect and an unmoved mover. They accept this unmoved mover as an addition to self-moving soul. But this proliferation of sources of motion is not philosophically well motivated, since each seems to be a sufficient condition for cosmic motion all on its own. Marinescu argues that Proclus gives both kinds of movers an essential role. According to Proclus, an unmoved cause can only produce effects that are similarly unmoved (in Parm. 795.7-13). Or, more precisely, unmoved causes can only produce effects that have intelligible—not physical—motion. By contrast, mobile causes can produce physical movement. So, according to Marinescu, Proclus’ system requires an unmoved (i.e., intelligible or intellectual) cause for the rational soul. Such a soul is unmoving in as much as it is eternal in its essence, but temporal in its activity. Having a temporal activity, soul can then serve as a moving cause of other-moved effects (i.e., bodies). So, both the unmoved and the self-moved are needed for a full explanation of motion.
Chapter 3 takes us more deeply into the nature of soul as a self-mover. Different Platonic dialogues invite different understandings of the sense in which soul is self-moving. The Demiurge’s construction of the World Soul from circles that he sets in motion in the Timaeus can be taken to suggest that soul has extension, shape, and exhibits spatial motion. Laws 10, by contrast, offers a picture of psychic self-motion that is not spatial. Aristotle’s arguments in De Anima I.3 are directed at a spatial interpretation of psychic self-motion. While some middle Platonists, like Atticus and Plutarch, sought to defend Plato, they also accepted the spatial reading. Neoplatonists like Proclus, however, entirely rejected the spatial reading of Plato.
But Marinescu shows that Proclus dealt differently with Aristotle’s criticisms than did other Neoplatonists. Harmonists like Simplicius supposed that Aristotle criticised what he himself knew to be a mistaken understanding of Plato’s view in order to pre-empt misunderstandings by readers who were too literal-minded. Proclus, however, took Aristotle to have simply misunderstood Plato’s metaphorical talk and, consequently, to have launched objections that were simply irrelevant to Plato’s conception of the self-moving soul (114-115). And yet, Marinescu claims, Proclus also developed his own conception of soul’s incorporeal motion by reflection upon Aristotle’s misguided arguments against psychic physical motion.
So, in what way does soul move itself? Reflecting upon the implications of Aristotle’s criticisms of a spatially extended self-mover, Proclus supposed soul’s self-motion to be the activity of reversion (epistrophê)—literally a ‘turning back upon itself’. ET prop. 14 argues that anything capable of reverting upon itself must be incorporeal because self-reversion requires a total conjunction of a thing with itself. This is only possible with things that are partless. In addition, ET prop. 16 argues that what reverts upon itself has an essence separate from body. ET prop. 42 and 43 argue that what is incorporeal and has an essence separate from all bodies also constitutes itself or is authupostaton. Marinescu considers that the conjunction of these three conditions—self-reversion, incorporeal essence, and self-constitution—give Proclus the materials for an argument for the soul’s immortality. So, the Phaedrus (properly understood) is vindicated: if the soul’s essence is incorporeal self-motion (i.e., self-reversion), then it is indeed immortal.
The fourth and final chapter is much longer than the previous three and dialectically very complex. Marinescu takes up a long-standing problem in Aristotle scholarship—the causality of the unmoved mover—and considers it in light of competing Neoplatonic understandings of Aristotle’s position vis-à-vis Plato’s. In contemporary scholarship on Aristotle, we have interpreters who regard the unmoved mover simply as the final cause of motion, whilst regarding the natural circular motion of the fifth element that composes the heavenly bodies as the efficient cause of the celestial motions that, in turn, cause all the changes and motions here in the region below the Moon. Other interpreters make a case for the unmoved mover being both the final and the efficient first cause. There is, however, broad modern consensus that the unmoved mover is a cause (in whatever sense) simply of cosmic motion—not of the existence of the cosmos. Yet, in late antiquity, Simplicius and Ammonius regarded the unmoved mover as final and efficient cause of both the world’s motion and its very being. (This reading was historically influential inasmuch as it seems to render Aristotle congenial to the idea of a creator god.) In contrast to these harmonizers, however, Proclus argued that Aristotle could not have regarded the unmoved mover as both final and efficient cause of the world’s being because—as Proclus sees it—Aristotle simply had a defective understanding of what efficient causation really is. While Aristotle should have credited intellect with both causal roles in relation to the world’s existence, he didn’t. In this regard he is not in agreement with Plato (whose Demiurgic intellect in the Timaeus is both final and efficient cause of the visible cosmos).
For the reasons noted above, this is a well-argued and important book for scholars of late antique Platonism. It should also be of interest to philosophers working on Classical philosophy. Marinescu shows that Proclus was a thoughtful and critical reader of Aristotle’s work, as well as of Plato’s dialogues. Even if you find the philosophical edifice that Proclus and the other Neoplatonists constructed on the basis of their engagement with the works of Plato and Aristotle unconvincing, you may yet find insights from Marinescu’s account of that engagement.