Over a career spanning more than three decades, Chenyang Li has become one of the world’s leading interpreters of Confucian philosophy. From the beginning, he has been interested in both historical interpretation and more contemporary questions about comparison across traditions and philosophical development. Reshaping Confucianism is the culmination of Li’s work so far, bringing together and further refining a range of his groundbreaking arguments on issues including harmony, care, ritual, gender, freedom, and equality, as well as on newer topics like friendship, longevity, and civic education. The book is both an ideal overview of Li’s wide-ranging views and, taken as a whole, an argument for why and how to take Confucianism seriously as an ongoing philosophical project. In this review, I will begin by looking at each of the book’s three main sections before turning to critical engagement with its methodology, its treatment of challenges from feminism, and its approach to the way in which “progressive Confucianism” can fit into a pluralistic world.
After an opening methodological chapter that I will discuss later, the book’s first section—titled “Foundational Concepts”—contains three chapters. Chapter One argues both for a particular understanding of he 和 as “dynamic harmony” and for the centrality of that concept to Confucianism. Li has published extensively on harmony, including a 2014 book that was reviewed at NDPR (Tang 2014). Harmony is crucial to Li’s vision of Confucian philosophy for two main reasons. First, its protean nature allows him to emphasize the interrelated breadth of Confucian philosophy, including not just ethics and socio-political aspects but also metaphysics, cosmology, aesthetics, and so on. Especially because Li tends to lean more heavily on texts from the tradition’s early centuries and resist some of the more overtly metaphysical themes in later Confucianism, harmony works well as a fruitful point of departure.
Second, the dynamic, ever-unfolding nature of harmony that Li (plausibly) finds in the tradition also funds his understanding of the tradition itself as continually working itself out in relation to new knowledge, ideas, and conditions. Chapters Two and Three of this section move to the two other concepts that others have taken to be foundational to Confucianism: ren 仁, often translated as “humaneness” or “benevolence”, and li 禮, which Li follows many in translating as “ritual”. The chapter on ren makes a strong case for understanding it as two-leveled: “ren as a comprehensive virtue is rooted in care as a specific virtue” (53). Chapter Three then elucidates “ritual” through an analogy with “grammar”, explaining how the normative-yet-flexible, socially embedded nature of ritual serves as a “cultural grammar”, without which “meaningful life becomes impossible” (92).
Section II of the book contains four chapters, collectively titled “Self and Others”. The first of these chapters offers an account of xiao 孝, rendered by Li as “filial care” instead of the more common “filial piety”. Li says that “on the basis of the historical development of the concept and today’s moral sensibilities” (97), we should understand xiao to have physical, psychological, and moral dimensions, all of which have a basis in care for one’s parents.
Chapter Five turns to “Differentiated Gender Equilibrium”, partly in relation to the concept of bie 別 or “distinction”. The core idea here is to retain the ancient idea of “yin-yang differentiation, interdependency, and complementarity” (129), while neither linking yin firmly to female sex or gender nor accepting that yang is systematically superior to yin. This leads to a dynamic notion of “differentiated differentiations” between husband and wife, for example, in which spouses take on varying and equally valuable roles. I will probe these ideas a bit more below. Section II continues with a chapter on friendship which explicates the classical Confucian notion of friendship as a moral ideal which, Li argues, can solve the “fungibility problem” faced by many contemporary accounts of friendship. The section then closes with “Virtuous Life and Longevity”, in which Li explores an idea (shou 壽, longevity) that—despite being an important Chinese cultural ideal—has rarely been the subject of modern philosophical attention. Li’s main contention here is that a “holistic” (157) vision of virtuous and physically flourishing life that leads to longevity “can continue to inspire people in modern times” (172).
Next comes an important “interlude” on the topic of whether sages can be wrong. Li acknowledges that there are different views on the fallibility or perfection of sages within the tradition. Li sides firmly with those who—from ancient times to today—have viewed sages as fallible, mainly because this opens up possibilities for contemporary, progressive Confucians. Sagely fallibility means that canonical texts can be interpreted more freely; doctrines can be seen as evolving (and continuing to evolve); Confucian teachings can be corrected or improved upon; and Confucians today can grapple with new issues that do not have clear answers within the existing tradition. Without insisting that this is the only possible way to read the tradition, Li insists that “Progressive Confucian thinkers should fully use this special feature of Confucianism” (194).
The book concludes with four chapters in Section III, “Socio-Political Reconstructions.” The first two of these, on freedom and equality, are revised versions of two of Li’s best-known and most highly cited articles (Li 2014 and 2012, respectively). In each, he views ideas from classical Confucian texts in light of comparisons with both historical and contemporary Western philosophers, with the result that he can make explicit concepts of freedom (as choosing the good, zeshan 擇善) and equality (as a balance of numerical and proportional equality) that were primarily implicit, or at least not emphasized, in the tradition up until now.
Chapter Eleven is “Kingliness without Kings”, in which Li argues that modern Confucians must pursue Confucian social ideals through participation in democratic politics rather than through aspiring to non-democratic, “sagely” rule. The book closes with “Education for Humanity”, which makes three main points: education is central to Confucianism; Confucians can accept and build on Amy Gutman’s vision of a “democratic state of education” (268); and Confucian values can, in a limited way, be incorporated into modern, pluralistic civic education curricula.
Each of this rich book’s chapters could prompt further discussion, exactly as Li himself desires (2, 22). To begin my engagement with Li’s themes, let us look a bit deeper at his understanding of “progressive Confucianism”. Li is committed to the idea that Confucianism is a “living and evolving tradition” (1), and “progressive Confucianism” is the idea of finding “the most sensible and effective way to preserve and move Confucianism forward” (5). As such, progressive Confucianism can be found at any point in the tradition’s long history, balancing the twin requirements of “preserv[ing] an organic connection with its ancient sources” and “advanc[ing] itself with sensibilities developed through modern-day life experiences, keeping answerable to various contemporary challenges” (3). Li makes a point of saying that his “lower-case p” sense of progressive Confucianism is not a “specific formulation of Confucianism” but rather an orientation (5).
This, however, should not obscure the fact that Li does not view all developments of the tradition as equally positive. The development of thinking about filial care from Kongzi to Mengzi to Xunzi is something he endorses, as is the more recent movement among some Confucians toward embracing gender equality. But he resists the idea he associates with Zhu Xi that there may be a pre-determined li 理 (Pattern); instead, Li finds the ever-emerging normativity of dynamic harmony more compelling. He also rejects Zhu’s view of infallible sages (182) and the recent arguments of Chen Lai and others for an ontologized understanding of ren 仁 (17). Unlike some modern Confucians, it is important to Li that progressive Confucianism stay committed to the “general ideal of ‘inner sageliness and outer kingliness’”, albeit in somewhat transformed ways. All of this is to say that while it is indeed helpful to talk about progressive Confucianism in a content-neutral, “descriptive” way (5), Li is simultaneously making a normative argument for a distinctive development of the tradition. In my view, Li is too modest when he insists that he “does not aim to systematically present one particular formulation of a comprehensive Confucianism” (22).
One of the many areas in which Li has been a pioneer is in the relationship between Confucianism and feminism, beginning with one of his earliest publications (Li 1994). In the present book, he articulates an attractive, yin-yang based, dynamic notion of “differentiated differentiations” between husband and wife. I have three questions for Li’s view of gender, all meant to help continue to move the conversation forward. First, if we follow Li in detaching yin and yang from specific sex or gender assignments, is there a reason to continue to insist on viewing marriage as between husband and wife? In an admittedly sketchy way, I have suggested elsewhere that such a view of yin and yang can ground homosexual marriage, as well as a flexible and egalitarian way of looking at gender differences, non-binary gender, and gender fluidity (Angle 2022, 207).
Second, one of the most important insights of feminist philosophers is the way that power can structure even the most intimate relationships, as summed up in the slogan “the personal is political”. This suggests that progressive Confucians need to do more than just conceptualize a new way to think about gender roles and relationships; they must also work actively to uncover and critique ways in which existing institutions reinforce rigid expectations around gender.
Finally, I wonder if Li’s reasons for adopting an egalitarian view of “differentiated differentiations” are sufficiently clear. His core motivation seems to be that Confucianism “effectively adapt to social changes in modern times”, which suggests reasons that are external to the tradition itself (117). The overall tenor of his account of gender is that progressive Confucians may choose to view yin-yang in the way he describes, not that they must do so. The result is an argument that Confucianism can be compatible with modern social changes rather than a stronger endorsement of gender equality that might be used to demand further social changes. The looseness of Li’s normative position can also be seen in his rather weak reply to the conservative Confucian Jiang Qing’s call for a return to something much closer to traditional gender roles (136). In contrast, I have argued that commitments central to the Confucian tradition can be shown to demand gender equality and social change (Angle 2012, Ch. 7).
I will close with some thoughts about the book’s audience, especially considering Li’s final chapter, “Education for Humanity”. One audience at which Li aims is evidently students and scholars of Confucianism who come to the book already caring about the answers to questions like “what is meaning and the role of harmony within Confucianism?” Another audience at which he explicitly aims is general readers interested in an introduction to what Confucianism is.
In the final chapter, though, he takes up the question of Confucianism’s commitment to civic education and the role that Confucian concepts and values might play in a plural society. For example, suppose that, as a Confucian, one is convinced by the need for overcoming gender-based oppression in one’s society. Can Confucian arguments about yin and yang be part of public discourse or state-supported education? Li’s answer is threefold: Confucianism is non-exclusivist, so one can hold to its identity and values without giving up other identities; Confucian values overlap with many other traditions’ values, rendering them less controversial; and Confucian values can be advocated in a “thin” way that makes their appeal universal.
There is truth in all three of these assertions, but if we rest content with them, I fear we eliminate the challenging insights that could otherwise come from progressive Confucianism’s playing a more active role in plural societies. Europe’s experience with wars of religion led to a mainstream liberalism resting on a firm divide between private and public. In the hands of modern theorists like Habermas and Rawls, this resulted in a very narrow conception of public reason, shaped by historically contingent values rather than anything like an “ideal speech situation” or “original position” (see Kim 2016 for relevant discussion). At least some of Li’s chapters can be taken as efforts to revise how and what we all think and value, even if processes of dialogue or negotiation—or less explicit processes of shifting cultural capital—that could lead to such an outcome would still be required.
I am reminded of P. C. Chang’s effort to include ren in the Universal Declaration of Human Rights, which he endeavored to explain to the other drafters as “two-man mindedness”. eventually, they all agreed that Article One should read: “[All human beings] are endowed with reason and conscience and should act towards one another in a spirit of brotherhood” (Morsink 1999). This is not exactly Confucianism, but it certainly comes closer than previous drafts had done. It is to be hoped that in communities around the world, progressive Confucianism finds a seat at the table as we grapple with the challenges of the twenty-first century.
REFERENCES
Angle, Stephen C. (2012). Contemporary Confucian Political Philosophy: Toward Progressive Confucianism. (Cambridge, UK: Polity Press).
——— (2022). Growing Moral: A Confucian Guide to Life. (New York: Oxford University Press).
Kim, Sungmoon (2016). Public Reason Confucianism: Democratic Perfectionism and Constitutionalism in East Asia. (New York: Cambridge University Press).
Li, Chenyang (1994). “The Confucian Conception of Jen and the Feminist Ethics of Care: A Comparative Study.” Hypatia: A Feminist Journal of Philosophy 9 (1), 70-89.
——— (2012). “Equality and Inequality in Confucianism.” Dao: A Journal of Comparative Philosophy 11, 295-313.
——— (2014). “The Confucian Conception of Freedom.” Philosophy East & West 64 (4), 902-19.
Morsink, Johannes (1999). The Universal Declaration of Human Rights: Origins, Drafting, and Intent. (Philadelphia: University of Pennsylvania Press).
Tang, Yingying (2014). “Review of The Confucian Philosophy of Harmony.” Notre Dame Philosophical Reviews.