Resistance to Evidence

It is easy to dismiss conspiracy theorists and their ilk as irrational or dull, lost to the normative sway of the epistemic. Mona Simion’s Resistance to Evidence offers a timely intervention against this temptation. The centerpiece of Simion’s monograph is an externalist shift in our understanding of what it means to have evidence—eschewing the basic assumption that evidence is “in the head”, so to speak. As Simion unspools this thread, she uses it to weave a broad theory of epistemic normativity with implications well beyond resistance to evidence.

The resulting account yields an analysis of resistance to evidence as epistemic malfunction (and an argument that such malfunction is rare), a unified account of epistemic defeat, and a knowledge-first treatment of disinformation, among other applications. Much of this arises from one of the book’s most distinctive contributions: a novel argument for the existence of positive epistemic obligations.

Resistance to Evidence systematically engages with competing views, introduces original objections, and—being grounded in an embodied understanding of epistemic practice—resonates with current trends in epistemology. Simion’s account of epistemic normativity encompasses both traditional questions (justification, defeat, etc.) and newer concerns, such as testimonial injustice and inquiry. Taken together, these contributions offer a rich, unified account of epistemic normativity with the capacity to respond to our sometimes-antagonistic epistemic environments.

Part I surveys the existing philosophical and psychological literature on resistance to evidence, taxonomizing the broader category of evidence rejection and setting out the ambitious scope of Simion’s account. Dividing evidence rejection into justified and unjustified cases, Simion argues that the unjustified cases—each typically analyzed in isolation—are best understood as manifestations of a single phenomenon: resistance to evidence. From failures to uptake immediately available evidence (e.g., perceptual non-responsiveness) to cognitive biases in processing (e.g., unwarranted optimism) to interpersonal failures downstream of uptaking evidence (e.g., testimonial injustice), all are fundamentally forms of evidence resistance. The remainder of Part I is devoted to showing that the obvious way forward—generalizing a theory developed in response to one or another of the piecemeal phenomena—will not work. Simion shows that a wide array of such theories, including internalist accounts of the evidence one has (Ch. 2), views on evidence one should have had (Ch. 3), theories of permissible suspension (Ch. 4), and responsibilist virtue epistemology (Ch. 5), are inadequate to the task of characterizing resistance to evidence.

Part II delivers the positive account of resistance to evidence: failure to believe p despite sufficient, easily available evidence that p. Simion imbues such failures with normative significance through her knowledge-first functionalist framework. Here’s the argument:

Our cognitive systems have the etiological function of generating knowledge.

Satisfying this function requires taking up easily available evidence.

Therefore, cognitive systems failing to update on such evidence are malfunctioning.

Two lynchpins support this argument. First, the notion of an input-dependent etiological function. Simion offers a novel analogy to explain this idea: the knowledge-generating function of cognition is like the oxygen-absorbing function of our lungs. The proper functioning of our lungs depends on how they process inputs—whether and how well they absorb oxygen from incoming air. Likewise, our cognitive systems function well to the extent that they take up easily available evidence in our environment. This input-dependent functionalism grounds the account’s positive epistemic obligations not just to gather evidence, but also, having done so, to output appropriate beliefs.

Simion secures the claim that knowledge-generation (as opposed to, say, true belief-generation) is the etiological function of our cognitive systems by (a) demonstrating that knowledge-generation meets the criteria for being an etiological function of our cognitive systems and (b) arguing that we can identify the main function of a system, with respect to a particular type of function (here, epistemic functions), by finding its most valuable such function. Combining (b) with the claim that knowledge is the most valuable epistemic status, Simion concludes that knowledge-generation is the main epistemic function of our cognitive systems and is therefore the norm-determining function thereof (103–4).^[1]

The other lynchpin is Simion’s account of evidence itself, which keeps the wheels on the knowledge-first functionalist axle. Evidence as knowledge indicators articulates the sense in which agents’ evidence is not just “in the head”, supports the “knowledge-first” designation of the view, delimits the scope of positive epistemic obligations, and underpins Simion’s accounts of defeat, suspension, and—of course—resistance to evidence.

The account comes in two parts. First: “On my view, evidence consists of knowledge indicators, which enhance closeness to knowledge by enhancing evidential probability” (112). Enhancing closeness to knowledge is key because it connects evidence to the knowledge-generating function. From this, Simion derives positive epistemic obligations to update on our evidence.

Simion also offers the following more precise definition (112):

Evidence as knowledge indicators: A fact e is evidence for p for S iff S is in a position to know e and P(p|e) > P(p)

The probability here is evidential probability: probability on one’s total body of evidence (112). Unpacking this definition brings us to part two (114):

Being in a position to know (BPK): S is in a position to know a fact e if S has a cognitive capacity with the function of generating knowledge that can (qualitatively, quantitatively, and environmentally) easily uptake e in cognisers of S’s type.

For example, if you are in the grocery store looking directly at a fist-sized, round, orange object, that is a fact you can easily uptake. If it raises the probability of “I’m looking at an orange” on your total body of evidence, then it is a knowledge indicator for you with respect to that proposition. By contrast, if the store also has flowers by the check out, but you’re preoccupied with the oranges, then you’re not in a position to know there are flowers in the store. So, that fact is not (yet) evidence for you.

This marks a radical departure from standard accounts of having evidence. On Simion’s view, the fact that you are seeing a round, orange object is within your evidence, whether you take it up or not. Thanks to this innovation, Simion is able to offer a unified treatment of the wide range of cases introduced in Part I. Resistance can occur at any stage, from uptake to processing to output. What matters is the failure to believe p despite having (in Simion’s sense) sufficient evidence that p (117).

The remainder of Part II demonstrates the unifying power of this framework, drawing out implications for epistemic obligations (to believe p where one has sufficient, undefeated evidence that p (106)), justification (as epistemic obligation (106)), defeaters (as ignorance indicators (130)), inquiry norms, and permissible suspension of belief (occurring when one lacks sufficient evidence for justified belief that p (141)).

Part III turns to broader normative implications. Here, Simion tackles the concern that positive epistemic obligations may generate epistemic dilemmas, convincingly arguing that such dilemmas are rare. Because it takes care to illustrate the asymmetries between the moral and epistemic contexts, this is an especially illuminating discussion. Simion also analyzes skepticism as a form of resistance to evidence and closes the book by applying her framework to misinformation. After persuasively critiquing standard assumptions about misinformation, she proposes a novel, knowledge-first account: misinformation as ignorance-generating content. This approach dovetails neatly with the aforementioned account of defeaters and opens a promising new starting point for future work on misinformation.

Simion’s account clearly has much to recommend it. I now turn to two points that would benefit from further clarification.

1. Evidence as Knowledge Indicators

The articulation of evidence as knowledge indicators is somewhat slippery, particularly with respect to the relationship between two different properties: increased closeness to knowledge (ICK) and increased evidential probability (IEP). Ch. 7 describes evidence in two ways:

IEP-focused: “Evidence consists of facts that are knowledge indicators: facts that one is in a position to know and that increase one’s evidential probability (i.e. the probability on one’s total body of evidence) of p being the case.” (112)

ICK-focused: “Evidence consists of knowledge indicators, which enhance closeness to knowledge by enhancing evidential probability.” (112)

A natural question arises: How do these descriptions relate? Two candidates suggest themselves:

(1) ICK delimits knowledge indicators: Only those facts that increase one’s evidential probability and bring one closer to knowledge constitute evidence.

(2) IEP describes ICK: Increasing evidential probability is what brings one closer to knowledge.

If we assume that increasing closeness to knowledge cannot be achieved through raising one’s evidential probability in false propositions, (2) seems implausible. The fact that Simion’s discussion assumes that our positive epistemic obligations can include updating in such ways is further evidence against (2). We sometimes encounter evidence that raises our evidential probability in false propositions, so this Panglossian interpretation does not suit Simion’s realism.

Interpretation (1) is not so optimistic, but it faces a different problem: it simply rules out misleading evidence from the outset. If evidence must bring one closer to knowledge, then facts that would mislead cannot count as evidence. This contradicts Simion’s claim that misinformation can be such that “the audience’s body of evidence is changed to include misleading justification defeaters,” (186). So, (1) will not work either.

The foregoing relies on a narrow understanding of closeness to knowledge, and I suspect that the solution lies in a full articulation of this concept. While such is beyond the already broad scope of Resistance to Evidence, exploring ICK would both clarify the relationship between the different descriptions of evidence and constitute an important epistemological contribution on its own.

2. Not Like Us?

Simion’s account is admirably grounded in the cognitive capacities of agents like us. As mentioned above, her definition of being in a position to know (BPK) is indexed to “cognisers of S’s type”. Recall that BPK matters because it is crucial for generating the book’s positive epistemic obligations. But two clarifications of BPK—the individuation of cognizer types and the availability ranking for evidence—pull in opposite directions.

Cognizer types are individuated by their “cognitive architecture” and “inherent social and physical limitations” (114). Mere “cognitive furniture”—biases, beliefs, and so forth—is not sufficient to individuate types (115).

This demarcation matters for adjudicating cases like misdirected attention, which is among the targets enumerated in Part I. In this case, Professor Racist’s attention “automatically goes to the white students, such that he doesn’t even notice the Black students” when he asks questions (10). So, he forms the belief that Black students are not active in his class. Because bias is mere cognitive furniture (rather than cognitive architecture), Professor Racist and, say, Professor Decent Human Being are of the same cognizer type. Thus, Professor Racist is blameworthy for failing to uptake the easily available evidence (his Black students raising their hands), and his belief is not justified (130).

The availability ranking plays a very different role. Because our environments contain many more facts than we are able to take up, BPK immediately gives rise to a worry that it overgenerates epistemic obligations. Simion responds with further fidelity to our cognitive architecture: “I am only under an obligation to take up a quantitatively manageable subset of facts.” (115). In particular, “the most easily available subset of facts that I can take up delivers the set of evidence I have,” (116). This is the work of the availability ranking, which Simion takes to be a feature of our cognitive architecture.

But, availability rankings are not independent of our cognitive furniture. Habits of attention (Saint-Croix, forthcoming), salience perspectives (Whitely, 2022), and the act of attending itself (Watzl, 2017) all influence which facts are “most available” to us. This is also evident in Simion’s explanation of how her account manages inquiry (146). As Munton (2021) suggests, this influence extends to noxious biases, too: part of what it is to be racist, for example, is to attribute undue salience to racial features. So, if Professor Racist’s availability ranking filters facts about his Black students raising their hands out from the “most available set” of facts, Simion’s account should predict no obligation to update on those facts. The point is this: the type of cognizers we are is a type whose availability ranking depends on our cognitive furniture, bias and belief included. Unless we hold that such facts cannot fall outside the “most available set” (which may perhaps patch this particular case, but is a limited solution nonetheless), it is unclear that BPK can simultaneously respect the vicissitudes of cognizers like us and accommodate Simion’s full range of cases.

Resistance to Evidence is an elegant, exciting, and ambitiously unifying contribution to epistemology. It advances a novel, knowledge-first theory of epistemic normativity while remaining attuned to a wide range of contemporary concerns. Even where questions remain, they are generative ones, opening promising paths for further inquiry. Simion’s book would make a lively foundation for a graduate seminar and will likely influence future work across the field.

REFERENCES

Flores, Carolina (forthcoming). Resistance to Evidence, by Mona Simion. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2024. Pp. xiv + 214. (Review). Mind.

Munton, Jessie (2021). Prejudice as the misattribution of salience. Analytic Philosophy 64 (1):1-19.

Saint-Croix, Catharine (forthcoming). The Epistemology of Attention. In Kurt Sylvan, Ernest Sosa, Jonathan Dancy & Matthias Steup, The Blackwell Companion to Epistemology, 3rd edition. Wiley Blackwell.

Watzl, Sebastian (2017). Structuring Mind. The Nature of Attention and How it Shapes Consciousness. Oxford, UK: Oxford University Press.

Whiteley, Ella (2022). Harmful Salience Perspectives. In Sophie Archer, Salience: A Philosophical Inquiry. New York, NY: Routledge. Chapter 11.