Responsibility and Desert

When we ask what justifies blaming or punishing someone, a common answer is ‘they deserve it’. How should we understand this idea, and is it true? Free will sceptics like Pereboom take the fundamental notion at issue here to be ‘basic desert’, understood as desert that is not justified in terms of some further notion, e.g., consequentialist considerations. It is difficult to know how to assess whether agents can be basically deserving of blame and punishment, as providing reasons in support risks introducing some other normative bedrock. What more can be said about something that, by hypothesis, has no further basis?

Quite a lot, in fact. Desert and Responsibility examines the relationship between basic desert and several concepts, phenomena, and questions concerning moral responsibility, mainly blame, punishment, desert, and fittingness. McKenna has previously argued that the free will and moral responsibility debate doesn’t exclusively depend upon basic desert, but here he aims to meet the sceptics on their own terms. Building on his conversational theory of moral responsibility, he proposes that ‘responsibility exchanges’ are analogous to exchanges between competent speakers of a language—which can be more or less intelligible—and this illuminates the ways that blame and punishment can be more or less fitting in virtue of their status as bearers of meaning.

The first few chapters lay out the conversational theory, examine the debate around and the importance of basic desert, and argue that agents can be basically deserving of blame and punishment. Later chapters clarify further details and situate the account among other topics, such as whether Strawson was against fittingness and how this might impact compatibilist projects, whether the free will debate must be understood in terms of basic desert without having changed the subject, the role of guilt and self-blame in our practices, how social inequities can impact the meaning of our actions, and why sceptics about retributivism shouldn’t be reluctant to blame and punish in practice, given their important collective benefits.

A welcome move is that—in contrast to many Strawsonian-inspired accounts—McKenna takes the blaming and punishing at issue in holding agents accountable to concern not only having attitudes and emotions but expressing them in our treatment of others. This makes the basic desert theorist’s task harder, as negative treatment more clearly sets back targets’ interests, requiring stronger justification. McKenna’s proposal is that basic desert should be understood in axiological terms: a world in which someone is blamed or punished (in a manner fitting to their transgression) because they are blameworthy is better than a world in which they are not.

To explain why this is good, McKenna cites reasons related to the targets’ commitment to membership in the moral community, the blamer’s commitment to morality, and blame’s role in an activity whose aim is to sustain the bonds of moral community. Against the charge that these are instrumental considerations, McKenna argues they are actually extrinsic goods, and this is enough to secure a basic desert thesis. While their goodness depends upon factors external to them, they are not good only insofar as they produce certain ends.

Some external leverage for this picture is gained via an analogy with grief: grieving is surely a harm, but it also seems non-instrumentally good, connected with accepting our humanity. A life without grief in response to losing loved ones would be worse than one with grief. Even if it seems that grief is good as a manifestation of caring, this cannot be separated conceptually from the pain. While many goods trade-off against bads, the goods in grief and blame gain significance by being in response to something of disvalue.

Even if it is unlikely that thinking about grief will be the foundation from which to forever refute basic desert sceptics, this isn’t necessary: McKenna is playing defence against existing sceptical arguments, demonstrating that it is at least plausible that agents can basically deserve blame, and thus, a modest retributivism can survive. He also notes many places where his arguments operate independently of his conversational framework’s commitments, meaning that even if one doesn’t endorse the full account, there are many useful threads which can be taken up by other parties in these debates.

The book is valuable not only for elucidating what a viable basic desert proposal can look like but also for clearly mapping the many choice-points parties to this thorny debate can take. That being said, it is very much a technical book, drawing together threads from numerous still-evolving debates into a single comprehensive picture, with detours to address many objections along the way. I mention this because newcomers to the literature or graduate students looking for a survey of the field will find keeping track of all these threads challenging.

McKenna also investigates how basically deserved punishment can be understood within a conversational theory of moral responsibility. As this is perhaps the topic with the highest argumentative stakes and the most intricate theory-building, this is where I’ll focus my attention for readers. His thinking is as follows (§4.4). Both blame and punishment aim for their target to experience a fitting kind of guilt; note how a target feeling guilty often provides reasons to temper one’s blame. However, some kinds of wrongs are sufficiently egregious that we are warranted in forcing the point we intend to convey in our ‘conversation’ with them, so that ‘they get it’.

But we do not merely want to cause the guilt by whatever means necessary; they are not an object to be manipulated but a being with dignity. We want the guilt to come about as a result of our engagement with them as an interlocutor. Punishment thus functions as a form of persuasion to accept culpability and experience guilt. Fitting punishment creates conditions tailor-made to making our target experience guilt with a particular kind of content. It does this by providing conditions that one with a guilty mind should regard as deserved. It is a way of enforcing external conditions that, if guilt were internalised, should count as fitting outward expressions of our target’s deserved painful guilt in response to her crime.

Here are several reasons we might punish someone: to set back their interests; to forcibly communicate something; to communicate as a respectful interlocutor; to create conditions conducive to experiencing guilt; to create conditions our target would see as fitting if they were to experience fitting guilt; to create conditions our target would accept as an expression of her fitting guilt. To someone outside the conversational theory, McKenna seems to be identifying a section of overlap in their Venn diagram as key to understanding punishment’s nature and justification within our accountability practices.

But it seems to me these are very different things which can be in tension with one another, putting pressure on the framework. I struggle to think of other cases where forcing my point onto someone against their protests wouldn’t be in tension with respecting their dignity as an interlocutor or could be described as “persuasion” (93). Wanting someone to experience fitting treatment can also be in tension with wanting them to see that treatment as deserved; the flavour of our punishment might be fitting only because the target doesn’t experience guilt or think such treatment is deserved. It also seems possible someone could experience fitting guilt and express this in ways other than by accepting punishment, even if it remains true that punishment is fitting for others to dole out.

The way McKenna delineates this section of overlap successfully retains the conversational framework’s sensitivity to the many factors that can affect an actions’ meaning and its role in a conversational exchange. This makes it flexible enough to accommodate a wide variety of intuitions about a variety of cases, and bringing some order to heterogeneous accountability phenomena is a strength. But that flexibility can also make it harder to adjudicate substantive disagreements about our exchanges.

Suppose I think punishment centrally aims to produce something other than guilt; perhaps another kind of suffering. McKenna can reply that fitting (paradigm) punishment would aim at guilt because that would be a fitting conversational response. Suppose I think punishing someone who (unconvincingly) denies any culpability doesn’t seem like respecting them as an interlocutor. McKenna can reply that it’s the conversational responsibility exchange regarding their quality of will that matters, and your punishment is a fitting reply to their disregard; in this sense you are engaging with them as an interlocutor. Suppose I object that if fitting guilt is felt in response to my punishing, then my ‘point’ has been made, making continued punishment (conversationally) redundant. Again, McKenna can say that continued punishment remains a fitting reply to the agent-meaning of the target’s original transgression. Or, that since they’d accept continued punishment, which itself expresses a meaning, there is a point to continued punishment. Each reply isn’t unreasonable, but it seems the flexibility makes it harder for proponents to independently converge on what actions have what meaning and could act as a cover for claims that would otherwise need more defence.^[1] I wonder if this gives more weight to resources from outside the conversational theory and our practices as we find them, such as those that (perhaps) a linguist or evolutionary psychologist might use (cf. costly signalling theories of blame).

An illustrative example is in Chapter 8. Many philosophers have argued that blaming attitudes or emotions are inherently problematic because they seek overly hostile treatment of their target. McKenna argues that even if our emotional responses involve tendencies towards morally indefensible responses, e.g., seeking suffering or ‘striking back’, we need not think of them as mechanical or passive because we are rational beings. They can be actively exercised intelligently, with considerable variation in how they get manifested, and expressed in ways that are tempered, humane, or compassionate. Only unchecked anger is bad.

When interpreting this reasoning within the conversational theory, it seems a proponent would say that regulated anger, expressed carefully, will have its agent-meaning determined mostly by its role as a means of holding people accountable and communicating how the wrong affected victims. But anger’s prototypical, unregulated tendencies, and the hazards that remain even when expressed by people with usually-but-imperfectly regulative dispositions, are very plausibly things that affect the meaning expressions of it have in our conversational exchange. Anger often communicates that—but for my self-control—I am feeling disposed to harm you. Most people’s self-control has limits, so even if there’s little risk of actually flying off the handle, it will be the case that I am nevertheless closer to flying off the handle when angry than I typically would be.

This sort of fact, along with anger’s evolutionary history, seems like a prime candidate for at least part of anger’s meaning being essentially hostile. Indeed, McKenna notes (185) that part of the harm of being blamed stems from the experience of having been targeted with (moral) anger, not ‘regulated anger’. If anger’s unchecked tendencies are indefensible, and anger’s meaning is acquired from these unchecked tendencies, then it also seems like the meaning it would have when expressed could also be indefensible, even when expressed by someone who can (usually) regulate it.

Despite these questions, this book is a worthy sequel to McKenna’s influential Conversation and Responsibility. A recurring strength is McKenna’s indefatigable desire to defend our actual accountability practices in all their messiness as being valuable, intelligible, and principled against sophisticated but revisionary philosophical arguments. It is a much-needed defence of a (qualified, carefully understood) retributivism about blame and punishment and a rich investigation into the many intersecting questions regarding its titular concepts. The blameworthy deserve blame, the praiseworthy deserve praise, and Desert and Responsibility deserves the attention of everyone writing on moral responsibility.