This is a wonderful book. It provides a remarkably clear, well-argued articulation of a theory of moral and legal responsibility that is informed by and responsive to relevant philosophical, legal, and psychological literatures. David Brink patiently and scrupulously considers alternative views and objections to his own view, providing a fair, balanced, and constructive treatment of some of the most complicated issues in Moral Philosophy and the Philosophy of Law. Unlike all too many philosophers, he does not treat law as merely an instrument for implementing moral principles that are discovered independently of reaping the fruits of legal reasoning. Instead, he appreciates the role of law in the development of morality, as well as the influence of morality on the law.
The scope of the book is remarkable. Included are critical discussions of and constructive supplements to the best contemporary philosophical work on freedom and determinism, the distinction between justification and excuse and between full and partial excuses, the question of whether psychopaths are morally or legally culpable for wrongful actions, the nature of the cognitive and volitional capacities required for responsibility, the importance of the distinction between having a cognitive or volitional capacity and the failure to exercise it, along with an account of when such failures are culpable and when they are not, and a nuanced answer to the question of whether “moral blind spots” excuse wrongful actions.
The main thesis of the book is that a wrongful act is excusable, if and only if, at the time it was performed, the agent did not have a “fair opportunity” to avoid acting wrongly and that “fair opportunity” requires (1) sufficient normative capacity, which includes both a cognitive and a volitional element, and (2) sufficient situational control (102). Normative capacity includes “reason-responsiveness” that contributes to the individual’s ability to determine whether an act is morally or legally prohibited or permissible. The volitional element is the ability to conform one’s behavior to moral and legal norms. Situational control is the absence of conditions, such as duress, that prevent one from exercising normative capacity at all or from exercising it in a fully effective way. On this view, excuse and responsibility are inversely related and both are a matter of degree: a “full” excuse absolves the agent of all responsibility and a partial excuse is apt when the agent is responsible but not fully so.
Much of the book is devoted to drawing out the implications of this understanding of responsibility for a critical evaluation of the law’s treatment of responsibility. For example, Brink provides meticulous and insightful analyses of the insanity defense, as characterized in McNaughton, as an excuse, as well as a critical evaluation of the Model Penal Code’s account of excusing conditions. He provides a convincing reckoning of what these conceptions of responsibility get right and what their limitations and deficiencies are. He argues, persuasively in my judgment, that psychopaths are not “morally blind” in a way that excuses their wrongful actions, because even if it is true that they lack both empathy and appropriate fear of punishment for wrongdoing, they nonetheless have the cognitive capacity that is required for responsibility. He supports this conclusion by citing up-to-date studies of the cognitive capacities of psychopaths that suggest that they do have both normative capacity and situational control, but tempers his findings by noting that research on the nature of this condition is ongoing.
Brink provides the best available critical discussion of the implications of P.F. Strawson’s highly influential essay “Freedom and Resentment,” distinguishing between two quite different interpretations of that provocative but deeply ambiguous work (26–38). He observes that Strawson’s main thesis, “that the moralized reactive attitudes are fitting or appropriate just in case the targets of those attitudes are responsible” can be given either a “response-dependent” justification of our attributions of responsibility or a “response-independent”, realist interpretation. According to the former, our reactive attitudes provide the only grounds for believing that our attributions of responsibility are valid. According to the realist interpretation, attributions of responsibility can be given a justification that is independent of any assumption that the reactive attitudes are a reliable guide to attributions of responsibility. Brink argues for a realist interpretation, making the case that there is good reason to hold an agent responsible for their action if at the time the action was performed, they had “normative capacity” and “situational control” as specified above. He concludes that the reactive attitudes ought to be regarded as appropriate and action-guiding only so far as they track responsibility as defined in terms of normative capacity and situational control. Under the right circumstances, reactive attitudes experienced by persons with normal moral capacities can perhaps create a presumption of responsibility, but the full justification of attributions of responsibility is response-independent.
In my judgment, there are two closely related topics dealt with in the book that cry out for further clarification and theoretical elaboration: Brink’s conception of situational control and the idea that one can be partly responsible and partly excused. The need for clarification can be appreciated if we consider an important issue that is only dealt with indirectly in the book: responsibility for wrong-doing caused in part by ideological beliefs. In terms of Brink’s framework of analysis, the question is whether ideological beliefs can impair either cognitive capacity or situational control to such an extent as to render an agent not responsible for wrongdoing grounded in those beliefs. Brink’s discussion of “moral blind spots” provides the beginning of a satisfying answer to that question.
A person has a “moral blind spot” if they are unable to see that a moral norm whose validity they acknowledge in a wide range of other cases applies to some particular phenomenon. One of Brink’s examples is that of an Antebellum Southerner who believes that humans have natural rights but nonetheless believes that slavery is morally permissible (298–300 ). Brink suggests that since this individual is able to apply the notion of natural rights appropriately to White people, they are not lacking in the cognitive element of “normative capacity.” He also concludes that this individual satisfies the volitional element because they are able to conform their behavior to norms concerning respect for natural rights in a wide range of conditions (so far as they involve the treatment of White persons). And he concludes that even if the “moral blind spot” regarding the status of Black people is the result of an internalization of racist views that are included in the individual’s acculturization, they are still responsible for wrongful acts that the “moral blind spot” encourages.
Brink does go on to add a major qualification to this conclusion, however. He holds that if the individual suffers from sufficient “epistemic isolation” they will not be responsible for wrongful behavior resulting from the failure to apply consistently moral norms that they endorse and are capable of applying appropriately in a wide range of other cases (299). By “epistemic isolation” he apparently means an environment in which there is powerful social pressure to fail to engage in moral consistency reasoning that would eliminate the “blind spot,” and the absence of exposure to views that challenge the wrongful behavior in question. Brink also adds another qualification: Depending on just how “isolating” the epistemic environment is, the individual may be either fully excused (not responsible at all) or partially excused (partially responsible) for wrongful behavior that manifests a “moral blind spot"). In brief, although he does not offer or rely on a theory of ideology, he believes that when a person has internalized an ideology and the environment in which they inhabit reinforces that ideology and insulates it from criticism, the requirement of “situational control” is not satisfied or not sufficiently satisfied to absolve the individual of all responsibility for ideologically-grounded wrongful actions.
Brink’s view here is promising, but the concept of exculpating “epistemic isolation” requires more elaboration. What is needed is an account of the conditions under which the exercise of the capacity for moral consistency reasoning is impaired along with a principled view of which sorts of impairments are exculpating and which are not. Brink’s “fair opportunity” theory of responsibility, with its distinction between normative capacities and situational control, provides a promising framework for developing an account of when wrongful action stemming from ideological beliefs is culpable and when it is not. One hopes that in the future he will devote his formidable powers of philosophical analysis to working out the implications of his theory of responsibility for ideology theory.
This fine book will be of great value for individuals in Moral and Political Philosophy, the Philosophy of Law, Moral Psychology, and Ideology Theory. The exceptional lucidity of Brink's prose makes following the intricacy of his arguments well worth the effort.