Amie Thomasson is a leader of a programme for deflating the pretensions of metaphysics and finding something better for philosophers to do. She locates this programme within a broad neo-pragmatist tradition. Her latest book is a further contribution to the overall project and updates it by reference to recent trends in metaphysics.
The first half of the book tries to show that there are no deep metaphysical truths out there to be discovered. This enterprise risks self-defeat, for if there are no deep metaphysical truths out there, that itself looks suspiciously like a deep metaphysical truth discovered by Thomasson and her allies, if their arguments work.
Thomasson starts by emphasizing the lack of agreement in contemporary metaphysics, and the dim prospects for achieving it. This heightens the risk of self-defeat, for there is just as little agreement in her own line of work, contemporary metametaphysics, and the prospects for achieving it are equally dim. Indeed, metametaphysics is hard to separate from metaphysics, as just seen. The book will persuade few contemporary metaphysicians of the error of their ways; this review will no doubt leave neo-pragmatists feeling equally untroubled.
According to Thomasson, the epistemology of contemporary metaphysics is irredeemably mysterious, and so, conducive to scepticism. That will be news to many who work in metaphysics and take its epistemology to be broadly abductive, like that of other highly theoretical sciences. On one version of this view, metaphysics works by inference to the best explanation; its explanations are constitutive rather than causal. For Thomasson, a metaphysical theory does not do the right sort of work in explanations to be confirmed if the explanations succeed; some other metaphysical theory could be substituted for it without explanatory loss. As she puts it, the metaphysical theory does not ‘fuel’ the explanations.
The book’s dismissal of inference to the best explanation in metaphysics is too cursory to be convincing. More specifically, its picture of explanation is too closely modelled on causal explanation to give explanation in metaphysics a fair chance. A more sensitive approach would have spent more time on the varieties of non-causal explanation in the natural sciences before making comparisons with metaphysics. For example, theoretical unification is a form of non-causal scientific explanation, as in Newton’s unification of terrestrial and celestial mechanics. As that example suggests, unifying explanations can confirm the unifying theory. Metaphysical theories, with their great generality, are often intended to play a unifying role; if they succeed, why should they not be confirmed thereby?
On an increasingly widespread view, which this book ignores, abduction plays a central role in the epistemology of logic and mathematics too. Axioms and first principles of logic or set theory are not self-evident, nor are they conventional stipulations; genuine non-verbal disputes rage as to whether they are true or truth-preserving. Their theoretical standing depends on their abductive virtues—simplicity, strength, and fit with evidence, including the capacity to unify what is already known in the field without collapsing into absurdity—or lack of them. The theorems of such an abductively confirmed logical theory are good candidates for principles of a structural core of metaphysics.
As it happens, I am no enthusiast for most of the specific metaphysical approaches criticized in the book. But they are serious attempts at systematic theorizing, which deserve a more discriminating and careful treatment. Arguably, their main problem is not that they are scientistic, but that they are not scientific enough—they are under-constrained and overfitted.
In calling metaphysics a science, still immature if not still young, I do not restrict the term ‘science’ to the natural sciences, such as physics and biology, in which experimentation, observation, and measurement play so large a role. I use the term ‘science’ broadly, for any form of systematic, critical, evidence-based inquiry. In that sense, both mathematics and scholarly history are non-natural sciences. So is metaphysics, and philosophy more generally.
By contrast, Thomasson leaves no room for metaphysics as a science. In particular, she reduces ontology to ‘easy ontology’, which merely expresses trivial conceptual or linguistic rules. The book repeatedly adverts to such rules en masse but does not articulate them with the clarity or generality a linguist might expect.
A main example running through the book is how nominalisation introduces talk of properties by taking us from ‘That house is red’ to ‘That house has the property of being red’, for example. Thomasson treats such equivalences as trivially valid instances of a linguistic rule, making the existence of properties a case of epistemologically unproblematic easy ontology. She fails to note that the underlying rule is a naïve comprehension principle for properties, which is notoriously inconsistent by a variant of Russell’s paradox, since it makes ‘The property of not self-having has itself’ equivalent to its own negation. The outputs of a logically inconsistent rule are hardly epistemologically unproblematic.
Of course, one can try to restore consistency by revising the original comprehension principle without dropping its most everyday instances, but historically, that has involved an arduous process of logical investigation and discovery quite unlike Thomasson’s image of easy ontology. Indeed, it has led to higher-order metaphysics, a rapidly emerging branch of metaphysics not mentioned in the book. Higher-order metaphysics uses the rigorous methods of type theory and higher-order logic, with quantification into predicate and sentence position; theorems are proved and discoveries made, as elsewhere in logic and mathematics. Higher-order theorizing is not just niche metaphysics. On its intended interpretation, second-order logic is arguably the best available framework for Peano arithmetic as a branch of mathematics since second-order arithmetic is categorical, in the sense that all its models are isomorphic to each other, whereas first-order arithmetic allows models of different non-standard structures and thereby fails to capture mathematicians’ intentions. For related reasons, higher-order logic is arguably the best available framework for set theory too. By contrast, in what the book presents by omission as an attitude of complacent incuriosity, easy ontologists leave underlying contradictions unidentified, rich logical structures unexplored, and deep structural connections with other disciplines unmade.
For Thomasson, attempts at scientific metaphysics are worse than futile. They depend on an underlying error: the misconception that all discourse has a single function, to ‘track’ features of reality. They ignore the diversity of other functions served by language. When the book turns to another form of contemporary metaphysics, the reader can already predict that its failure will be blamed on this misconception. It is like a doctor who diagnoses all patients with the same disease, whatever symptoms they present with.
Probably, all the metaphysicians whom Thomasson criticizes for treating language as though it served only a single function would happily agree with her that it serves many. Not only are there multiple forms of non-declarative sentence, such as the imperative and the interrogative, and multiple forms of verbal but non-sentential utterances, such as greetings and exclamations, but uttering a given declarative sentence can also serve many different functions. One can say ‘It’s cold outside’ to start a conversation with a stranger, to get someone to close the window, to parody British conversation, to display one’s competence in English, or whatever. So much is uncontroversial. What non-easy metaphysicians may add is that the sentence still expresses the proposition that it’s cold outside, even if the utterance’s primary purpose is not to communicate its truth. Which proposition it expresses is determined by the compositional semantics of the language, applied to the given context. Normally, achieving the other purposes depends on expressing the proposition, unless the speaker just wants to make a noise or create a diversion. Non-easy metaphysicians focus on the proposition expressed.
As the book goes on, it encourages the reader to expect much-needed support for its deflationary treatment of metaphysics from functionally oriented linguistics. When it finally arrives, in Chapter 7, in the form of Michael Halliday’s Systemic Functional Linguistics (SFL), it proves a dampish squib. Thomasson’s exposition focuses on three ubiquitous aspects of mature language: the ‘ideational metafunction’ concerns informational content, the ‘interpersonal metafunction’ the negotiation of social relations, and the ‘textual metafunction’ the organization of discourse. Of these, non-easy metaphysicians will acknowledge the obvious importance of the interpersonal and textual metafunctions for communication but deny them any distinctive role in metaphysics.
That leaves the ideational. On Thomasson’s account, SFL has nothing very helpful to offer on how exactly a given sentence encodes some given informational content. There, by default, it hands over to more standard theories of compositional semantics. Although Thomasson evinces some sympathy for old-fashioned expressivist theories about various kinds of sentence, she is well aware of the notorious Frege-Geach problem concerning the need to explain embedded occurrences of such sentences under negation and other operators. She does not reject compositional semantics outright, though her instinct may be to deflate it, whatever exactly that involves.
Thomasson takes modality as a case study of her approach in practice. According to her, the primary function of the modal verb system is interpersonal in the SFL sense. For example, we use deontic modals in applying social norms, and metaphysical modality is associated with the application of semantic norms.
There is a large hole in Thomasson’s account of modal verbs: restricted circumstantial modals. Very young children grasp the difference between ‘I can reach it!’ and ‘I can’t reach it!’. ‘That could easily fall over’ is only slightly more sophisticated. Such non-normative distinctions have clear practical utility. Light has been cast on their epistemology by the work of Sonia Roca-Royes on modal induction, Margot Strohminger on modal perception, and Barbara Vetter on ability modals, amongst others. Again, uses of the contextually restricted modal verbs ‘would’ and ‘might’ in everyday counterfactual conditionals and elsewhere typically arise from offline applications of our capacity for predictive updating, calibrated by past experience, to hypothetical inputs in the imagination.
Thomasson tries to marginalize such work by claiming that it concerns only ‘empirical modalities’, and so is irrelevant to metaphysical modality, which is what metaphysicians care about. For instance, she claims, empirical modalities cannot distinguish the statue from the clay (190-1). That is a mistake. I know in a very ordinary way that I could destroy the statue without destroying the clay by dropping the statue down the stairwell.
Metaphysical modality is best understood as the limiting case of circumstantial modalities. Whatever is restrictedly objectively possible is also unrestrictedly objectively possible. Such an approach to metaphysical modality makes far better sense of Kripke’s cases of the necessary a posteriori and the contingent a priori than does Thomasson’s strained attempt to link metaphysical modality to semantic norms. She also misses the connection between metaphysical modality and various kinds of non-epistemic, non-deontic modality in natural science, such as the possible states in phase spaces and dynamical systems and the possible outcomes in probability spaces. According to Kripke, such scientific examples inspired his possible worlds semantics for modal logic.
Thomasson’s reliance on FSL has misled her into seriously misrepresenting the modal verb system. A more standard compositional semantics for modal discourse, such as Angelika Kratzer’s, is both much more fruitful linguistically and much more friendly to modal metaphysics. As a test case for the neo-pragmatist approach, modality gives a negative verdict.
In the final chapters, Thomasson recommends metaphysicians to find more humble and more useful employment as conceptual or linguistic engineers. If they are not to do more harm than good, they will need to understand the conceptual or linguistic systems they are re-engineering considerably better than Thomasson’s FSL approach understands the modal verb system.
The book presents engineers as making practical decisions, but of course, such decisions are not epistemologically unconstrained. They should know that the bridge will not fall down if built according to their plan, or at least that its probability of falling down is acceptably low. Thomasson puts the epistemological standard for respectable employment very high: the work must be done ‘in an epistemologically transparent way’ (97). What is epistemological transparency? Having wrestled with the nature of knowledge by perception, memory, testimony, and inference, it is hard to find any of them epistemologically transparent. No good evidence is provided that conceptual or linguistic engineering is any more epistemologically transparent than contemporary metaphysics. As a sample of neo-pragmatism at its best, the book left me with a strong sense of a degenerating research programme.