Alan Malachowski’s Richard Rorty is an introduction to the work of the philosopher of its title, one on whom the titles bestowed include “most interesting philosopher in the world” (Harold Bloom) and “The Professor of Complacence” (Simon Blackburn). Malachowski is firmly in the Bloom camp; his book is “written on the premise” that Rorty’s work may constitute a “’quantum leap’ in philosophy” (9). As a result, his introduction maintains the heady sense of being in on something that characterizes much of Rorty’s own work. However, his characterization of Rorty’s project is largely a result of an emphasis on views that smack of irrationalism, ones that Rorty has (thankfully) largely come to reject. While acknowledging Rorty’s development would allow for an exposition of his work that addressed the worries of his critics, Malachowski’s reading leads him to dismiss these critics (e.g., as akin to “solid, soulless critics of progressive music” (163)). That said, Malachowski claims to present only a “particular Rorty” (10) and he does so in a book that is both clear exposition and spirited defense.
Malachowski’s account is “’comprehensive’ in that it deals with texts spanning the whole” of Rorty’s career (10). The book’s “narrative” (as opposed to a “topical”) approach allows the central themes of Rorty’s writing to emerge in the context of the works in which they were formulated. Malachowski’s first chapter, “Platonic yearnings,” begins with a discussion of Rorty’s brief intellectual autobiography, “Trotsky and the Wild Orchids.” Rorty came to philosophy in search of an “intellectual or aesthetic framework” that would exhibit the consistency of his aesthetic values (the “orchids”) and his ethical values. Having become convinced of philosophers’ inability to provide non-circular justification of their views, Rorty considered his search a failure. Without a nongainsayable foundation, Rorty concluded, philosophy is ultimately “a matter of out-describing the last philosopher.” While philosophy as practiced since Plato is a failure, the skills associated with it may be put to good use: they can be used to “weave the conceptual fabric of a freer, better, more just society” (27).
Now, Rorty’s rejection of philosophy since Plato appears more than a little hasty. One would be hard-pressed to find any contemporary philosophers who take themselves to be involved in a search for “nongainsayable foundations.” Even so, Rorty thinks that the search for such foundations is somehow implicit in the tradition of which these philosophers are part. Malachowski’s second chapter, “Conversation,” explains that Philosophy and the Mirror of Nature is Rorty’s attempt to show that this is so. Malachowski provides a clear account as to how Rorty, through that book’s Geistesgeschichte of modernity, argues that the representationalism that characterizes the philosophical tradition leads to the search for nongainsayable foundations. In Malachowski’s perspicuous formulation, Rorty shows that traditional philosophical concerns with knowledge and mind are “problematic” – “in the sense that they are pragmatically unfruitful” – and “optional” – in that they are a product of assumptions that, while deeply imbedded, are not rationally “inevitable” (38).
In his third chapter, “Pragmatism,” Malachowski’s discusses Rorty’s views on the realism- antirealism debate and the nature of truth, as well as his appropriation of Dewey and other philosophers, as presented in The Consequences of Pragmatism. Rorty’s Contingency, Irony, and Solidarity is the main focus of the following chapters, “Contingency” and “Liberalism.” In his discussion of Rorty’s notion of contingency, Malachowski points out that the fact that a problem is contingent (in that it’s dictated not by the nature of reason or some such) does not imply that the problem ought to be abandoned. His use of the distinction between hypothetical and absolute necessity is helpful here. While Rorty sometimes writes as though philosophers think confrontation of, say, the Problem of Free Will is “absolutely necessary” (dictated by the nature of reason), it is more plausible to suppose that they regard it as a “hypothetical necessity” (given our firmly entrenched – though contingent – concerns, this is a problem we must face). Why then should we turn away from these problems, even if we may do so? Malachowski tells us that “the combination of a lack of historical progress and the internal tensions” that characterize our attempts to solve these problems leads Rorty to suggest that we “take a crack at something else” (115). While Rorty does sometimes talk like this, at other times he offers a potentially more compelling reason: the vocabulary that produced these problems should be superseded by one “better suited for the preservation and progress of democratic societies” (109). Malachowski’s account of Rorty’s discussions of contingency and liberalism would be strengthened were it to explain and evaluate this reason more fully.
I claimed above that Rorty’s critics will find little here to persuade them; there is an important sense in which Malachowski would be unperturbed by this result. He decries what he calls the “hyper-critical approach” characteristic of mainstream Anglo-American philosophy and claims that Rorty’s work should be approached from “an initially sympathetic vantage point” (7). But if this admonition is to amount to anything beyond the obvious, will it not constitute a kind of “special pleading”? It won’t, Malachowski says, because such sympathy is made necessary by the fact that “Rorty is attempting to launch philosophy on a path that takes it into new territory incommensurable with present-day ‘hyper-critical philosophy’” (7). But incommensurability cannot be a reason for sympathy – in fact, it seems to render sympathy by definition impossible. Malachowski is right that a list of philosophers will reject the possibility of such “new territory,” but not, as he says, because they believe their “methods have universal jurisdiction” (whatever that may be), but because they follow Davidson in his rejection of conceptual schemes. But if that’s so, this list should include Rorty himself. It seems, then, that “incommensurability” does not insulate Rorty from criticism in the way Malachowski suggests it does.
Malachowski contends that to take the “hyper-critics” seriously would be to push Rorty’s innovations “back into the dusty bottle of conventional standards” (10). There may be an interesting point lurking here concerning the propriety of norms (one would not, for example, be warranted in rejecting a theorem of theoretical physics because it would make bad poetry), but Malachowski does not pursue it. For it sometimes seems as though he considers any standard by which Rorty might be effectively criticized “conventional.” He calls “small-minded” those critics who think that a “’contradiction’ or anomaly” in Rorty’s work would cause “his whole pragmatist sky [to] fall in” (28). But he later says that his critics are unable “to state their denial in terms that do not beg the question or tacitly assume what Rorty himself denies” (168). But if criticisms that point to an inconsistency among propositions Rorty accepts are inadmissible and criticisms that point to an inconsistency between a proposition Rorty accepts and other propositions which he doesn’t accept (but which the objector thinks are true) are inadmissible, then no criticisms are admissible.
It seems Malachowski ought to admit that if Rorty is, in fact, committed to a contradiction, then the “sky” in question does indeed “fall in.” He should also indicate that there is little reason to think his views are, in fact, inconsistent. Further, the fact that critics often “tacitly assume what Rorty himself denies” is cold comfort: the same might be said of those who criticize radical skeptics, flat-earthers, or convinced Nazis. And Rorty himself has argued (famously, in the case of the Nazi: see the introduction to CP) that the absence of a non-circular argument against such positions provides no reason to doubt one’s warrant in denying them.
This book is generally dismissive of Rorty’s critics – they most often “simply fail to understand what he is trying to do” (163). What they fail to realize, apparently, is that “Rorty’s ‘claims’ … are not designed to instill a fresh set of beliefs derived from the literal content of the statements they encapsulate.” That is, Malachowski thinks Rorty’s ‘claims’ are not claims at all. They are rather attempts “to prod us, by way of ‘edification’ … into exploring fresh ways of describing things.” His statements function simply on a “performative level” (20). Under the heading “Philosophical propaganda,” Malachowski likens Rorty to “Madhyamika philosophy,” saying that
Rorty’s views, and hence his ‘position-free position,’ are ‘edifyingly’ presented ‘to achieve an effect,’ that they should not be ‘tastelessly’ interpreted as further, if oblique and controversial, contributions to philosophy’s age-old quest for the final, truthful picture of reality. (22)
According to Malachowski, then, Rorty makes no claims to truth; he simply offers redescriptions in an effort “to achieve an effect.”
Now, it is undeniable that Rorty has endorsed such views. (Malachowski quotes bizarre passages in PMN to show that this is so.) But it is also undeniable that Rorty comes to reject this understanding of his project. In “Charles Taylor on Truth,”1 Rorty says that PMN was marked by an unhappy tendency to make existentialist noises,” one that resulted from a prior tendency to make
the unhappy distinction between “demonstrating that previous philosophers were mistaken” and “offering redescriptions in an alternative language” instead of briskly saying that to say that one’s predecessors used a bad language is just to say that they made a certain kind of mistake. (TP 92)
But it becomes evident that Malachowski’s endorsement of this “unhappy distinction” on Rorty’s behalf is central to his interpretation of Rorty’s work. To be sure we don’t miss the point, Rorty adds: “I am also happy to say that when I put forward large philosophical views I am making ‘claims to truth’ rather than simply a recommendation to speak differently” (TP 92). Malachowski’s failure to account for the changes in Rorty’s views over the years leaves him defending positions Rorty was right to leave behind.
This failure causes Malachowski to interpret Rorty as being far more suspicious of argument than the above quotes suggest. For instance, he assures us that Rorty “does not believe there is anything wrong with arguments as such” (43); this is, of course, anything but reassuring. Why say this? Because Malachowski takes Rorty to regard as important the fact that “practices, customs, habits, and conventions” play a role in determining a person’s beliefs. Why is this obvious fact significant? Because, he says, many philosophers deny it: though they may not admit it, they believe the following:
When philosophers believe something philosophically significant (say P) they believe it because it is true (and for no other reason). When, over time, they – or their successors – change their minds and come to believe Q instead (where Q now obviously implies that P is false) it is again the truth of Q that does the persuasive work: they come to believe Q because it is true (and for no other reason) (53)
While Malachowski attributes this position to Rorty’s critics, the principle of charity mitigates against attributing this position to anyone, since it’s not simply false, it’s incoherent: one cannot believe P “because it is true” if, in fact, P is not true. At most, one could believe P because one thinks (possibly falsely) that it is true. But this too makes little sense, since to think that P is true just is to believe P, and cannot thereby serve as a reason for (or a cause of) the latter. These concerns aside, the notion that many (most?) philosophers hold that the truth of P can serve as a reason for the belief that P is far-fetched at best. To hold such a position would be to think that when asked “why do you believe P?” a perfectly good answer is “because P is true.”
Malachowski rightly claims that Rorty does not take his rejection of metaphysical realism to imply the rejection of “the vocabulary of critical assessment,” including the distinction between “what is accurate” and “what is inaccurate” (5). However, Malachowski goes on to argue that such distinctions must be made according to “pragmatic criteria.” As an example of what he means, he claims that one account may be judged to be more accurate than another “because it more effectively satisfies certain desires or fulfils such and such a purpose” (5). But something has gone wrong here. Imagine a scenario in which my wife and I are trying to determine how a vase in our house was broken. She suggests that our daughter Emma might have knocked it over this afternoon, and I disagree. If she asks me, “Why is that account inaccurate?” I may respond “Because Emma was with me at the bookstore when the vase was broken.” If, however, I respond, “Because your account isn’t very useful,” then I would deserve her puzzled look. That answer is no more appropriate than “Because it fails to represent the nature of reality as it exists independent of human concerns” or “Because it is inaccurate.”
I take this to show that the language of critical assessment is tied no more to a pragmatic theory of truth than it is to metaphysical realism. To think otherwise is to fail to recognize the significance of the distinction between the first-person and third-person perspectives. To see this, imagine that I relate the above conversation with my wife to a student interested in questions about the nature of truth. If, as we discuss the nature of truth, I am to ask the student, “Why is that account inaccurate?” she might well respond, “Because it isn’t very useful” or “Because it fails to represent the nature reality as it exists independent of human concerns.” When we take up her perspective – not that of an inquirer trying to figure out who broke the vase, but of a third-person reflection on the inquiry – it becomes appropriate to offer theories of truth. As we saw above, however, to do so from the first-person perspective would be nonsensical – to think otherwise would be to regard “because it fails to represent the nature of reality” or “because it is useful” as justifications for a belief. The first-person perspective presupposes only what Gary Gutting calls “humdrum realism” or what Arthur Fine calls “the natural ontological attitude.”2 Metaphysical realism and the pragmatic theory of truth are at home only in the third-person perspective; that is, only when one takes up a standpoint outside that of the engaged inquirer, the perspective of theory or explanation.3 While Malachowski recognizes at one point that pragmatism and metaphysical realism function at the level of “explanation” (81), this recognition is not pervasive. Rorty – by his own best lights – can and should use the language of critical assessment without notions like “usefulness” or talk of “coping.” Such notions are appropriate only when he takes up the third-person perspective. While Fine and Gutting might counsel him to eschew the third-person perspective on truth, Rorty regards it as crucial to the realization of a liberal utopia that
the image of thoughts or words answering to the world … be replaced by images of organisms coping with their environment by using language to develop projects of social cooperation. (RC 263)
Malachowski’s efforts would be better spent were he to explain why Rorty think this is so and whether his position has any merit. His failure to do so leads him to call Simon Blackburn’s suggestion that “the rejection of questions [is] the distinctive theme of what [Rorty] calls pragmatism” a “silly accusation” (141). In fact, this is neither silly nor an accusation. Insofar as Rorty is committed to maintaining a first-person perspective, he will reject the many philosophical questions – especially those about the nature of truth –that arise only from a third-person perspective.
Lack of attention to these perspectives is one reason that Malachowski’s discussion of Rorty’s critics is unsatisfying. For example, Thomas Nagel says that Rorty seems to be able to modify his beliefs, not due to the force of argument, but “because it might make life more amusing … less cluttered with annoying problems” (164) – that is, because doing so would be useful. If Rorty (or his readers) do sometimes confuse the first and third-person perspectives, Nagel’s attitude is not inexplicable. To Nagel’s request for arguments for Rorty’s views, however, Malachowski states that anyone who understands Rorty will see no reason to offer arguments, since “metaphors, images, and all sorts of historical contingencies” are better explanations of intellectual change (166). But even if this account of intellectual change is accurate, only a confusion of the explanatory with the justificatory would lead one to eschew arguments in favor of “metaphors and images.”
Malachowski’s emphasis on views Rorty came to reject makes the resulting position less plausible than it ought to be. When he decides against what could have been a helpful discussion of Rorty’s views on science, he imputes to Rorty the claim that to say that “science captur[es] the truth about the world” is “no more intellectually justified than the rhetorical pats on the back modern politicians tend to award themselves” (16). He quotes approvingly Rorty’s statement that truth is “a compliment paid to sentences that seem to be paying their way and that fit in with other sentences that do so,” and attributes to Rorty a position he calls “pragmatism without truth” (73). While these statements may reflect views Rorty held at one time, they are among the views we have reason to think Rorty includes among the “dumb things” he “said in the past” (TP 92). Malachowski’s introduction to Rorty’s work – with its fine discussions of contingency, liberalism, and its subject’s “Platonic yearnings” – would have done well to leave them there.
Endnotes
1. In his Truth and Progress, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1998. Henceforth TP.
2. See Gary Gutting, Pragmatic Liberalism and the Critique of Modernity, Cambridge, Cambridge University Press, 1999, pp 3ff and Arthur Fine, "The Natural Ontological Attitude" in J. Leplin (ed.) Scientific Realism, Berkeley: University of California Press, 1984. Gutting’s account is particularly interesting in this connection, since it comes in the midst of an illuminating critical discussion of Rorty’s work.
3. The importance of the distinction between the first-person and third-person perspectives in Rorty’s work is forcefully argued in Akeel Bilgrami’s "Is Truth a Goal of Inquiry?" which can be found, along with a response by Rorty, in R. Brandom (ed.) Rorty and His Critics, Oxford: Blackwell Publishers, 2000. Henceforth RC.