Sartre and Analytic Philosophy collects together essays by thirteen analytically trained philosophers that, rather than engaging in interpretive disputes about Sartre’s texts, mine those texts for insights capable of making an impact on contemporary anglophone philosophy. Morag’s editorial introduction offers a psychoanalytic interpretation of the analytic/continental “divide” in terms of imaginary stereotypes and the mechanism of projection. Since the editorial introduction does not include a summary of the chapters, I will provide one here. The contributions can be roughly divided into five thematic clusters. Let me mention at the outset that most of the contributions focus on the philosophy of mind. While this is perhaps natural given that Sartre was a phenomenologist, I would have liked to see more engagement with Sartre’s ontology and metaphysics.
The first thematic cluster concerns self-consciousness and self-knowledge. In Chapter 3 Valérie Aucouturier compares and contrasts Sartre’s and Anscombe’s accounts of self-consciousness and the function of “I.” In Chapter 4 Pierre-Jean Renaudie and Jack Reynolds defend a Sartrean view of our “peculiar access” to our own minds, in contrast both to Daniel Dennett’s “heterophenomenology” and views that posit an epistemic asymmetry between first-personal and third-personal knowledge of mental states.
A second thematic cluster concerns Sartre’s attitude toward skepticism, including solipsism. In Chapter 5 Katherine Morris draws out similarities between Sartre’s and Wittgenstein’s attempts to dissolve the traditional problem of other minds. In Chapter 6 David Macarthur distinguishes Stanley Cavell’s skepticism about criteria from Cartesian skepticism and illustrates the former with Sartre’s famous description of the chestnut tree in Nausea. In Chapter 12 Sebastian Gardner explains how Sartre’s pessimistic account of concrete relations with others in Being and Nothingness gives way to the social ontology of the Critique of Dialectical Reason. Gardner’s essay also belongs to a third thematic cluster concerned with the political applications of Sartre’s early account of the imagination. Also concerned with this theme is Chapter 11 by Genevieve Lloyd, who explores, in connection with the contemporary notion of “social imaginaries,” Sartre’s account in The Idiot of the Family of how “received opinions” and “collective stupidity” can hamper the capacity to imagine new ways to live.
Chapters 7 and 8 focus on Sartre’s complex attitude toward Freudian psychoanalysis. Robert Sinnerbrink’s contribution (Chapter 7) recounts the fascinating story of the doomed collaboration between Sartre and John Huston on the screenplay for Huston’s 1962 film Freud: The Secret Passion. Talia Morag’s contribution (Chapter 8) defends a conception of the unconscious that avoids Sartre’s critique of the Freudian notion of the censor through a retelling of Sartre’s scene of the woman on the date, updated in light of the #METOO movement.
Chapters 9 and 10 address Sartre’s early theory of emotions. Anthony Hatzimoysis’s contribution (Chapter 9) draws out the relevance of Sartre’s account of anguish, especially its distinction from fear, for the psychiatric understanding of anxiety and related conditions. In Chapter 10 Demian Whiting mounts a critique of Sartre’s account of emotions as “magical” cognitive transformations and defends William James’s feeling theory of emotion against Sartre’s objections.
Paul M. Livingston’s (Chapter 1) and Stephen L. White’s (Chapter 2) contributions don’t clearly fall into one of these thematic clusters. Livingston argues (with reference to Badiou) that underlying Sartre’s and Frege’s seemingly opposed accounts of negation, both accounts presuppose a “metalogical” structure (the for-itself as a “detotalized totality” for Sartre, the Russell set for Frege). White presents independent arguments for two aspects of Sartre’s theory of perception: his direct realism and his activity-based model of experience.
In the remainder of the review, I will offer some critical comments on two of the chapters: Aucouturier’s chapter on Sartre and Anscombe and Morris’s chapter on the problem of other minds. I have chosen these chapters because I think they contain instructive errors—that is, errors that underscore exactly how fruitful dialogue between Sartre and contemporary anglophone philosophy can be. Another way to put this is that I think Sartre has more to offer to contemporary discussions than these authors recognize.
For both Aucouturier and Longuenesse, Sartre and Anscombe agree that (i) the use of “I” manifests self-consciousness and (ii) that self-consciousness is not, at least in its basic mode, consciousness of an object (Anscombe 1981, 24–5). For Anscombe, “I” manifests an “immediate agent-or-patient conception of actions, happenings, and states” (Anscombe 1981, 36); for Sartre, it manifests “non-positional consciousness (of) self” (Sartre 2018, 11). Aucouturier and Longuenesse part ways on Anscombe’s claim that “I” is not a referring term. Anscombe’s case for this claim is tied to the notion of “immunity to error through misidentification” (IEM). A number of authors hold that in certain uses of “I” (“I” as subject), such as “I am in pain,” the possibility of misidentifying the subject of the pain is ruled out (see, e.g., Shoemaker 1968). Aucouturier points out that uses of “I” as subject have this feature because such uses don’t involve identification at all, and so the question of who has the pain is not applicable. For Aucouturier and Anscombe, this entails that “I” is not referential. Here’s Anscombe’s argument for this thesis: In uses of “I” as subject, “getting hold of the wrong object is excluded” (Anscombe 1981, 32). If “I” were referential, it could only have this feature by referring to a Cartesian ego, since were I in a sensory deprivation tank no other object would be presented to me as a candidate referent. But “I” doesn’t refer to a Cartesian ego, so it doesn’t refer at all.
Anscombe’s argument fails because she holds a mistaken view of what is required for reference. She assumes that reference requires that the speaker possess a “conception of the object indicated,” i.e., some conception by which the object is identified (Anscombe 1981, 27). But on its now-standard semantics due to David Kaplan (1989), “I” is directly referential, which means that its reference is not determined by a Fregean sense or a description (a “conception”). If the Kaplanian account is correct, even if uses of “I” as subject are IEM because they don’t involve identification, it doesn’t follow that “I” doesn’t refer. Moreover, there are well-known difficulties for Anscombe’s thesis. Anscombe warns against taking “I” to be a referring expression just because of its syntactical role; doing so would be tantamount to taking the “it” in “It is raining” to be a referring expression (Anscombe 1974, 30; Aucouturier 2024, 76). But there is a key difference between these expressions. “I” inferentially behaves like a referring expression but the dummy “it” does not; “I am in pain” implies “Someone is in pain,” but “It is raining” doesn’t imply “Something is raining.”
There are other problems with Aucouturier’s account. Aucouturier argues that the Wittgensteinian distinction between uses of “I” as subject and uses of “I” as object should be abandoned. Even in cases usually classified as uses of “I” as object, she claims that misidentification is ruled out: “when I say ‘I have a bump on my forehead’ or ‘I broke my arm’ or ‘I am Napoleon’ I can mistakenly say so, because I have no bump, I did not break my arm, or I am (indeed) not Napoleon. But the mistake is in the object. I cannot be misidentifying the person (me) I am talking about” (Aucouturier 2024, 75–6). This claim relies on a misunderstanding of the claim that uses of “I” as object are susceptible to IEM. James Pryor defines “de re misidentification” as follows: (i) the subject attempts to express a singular proposition of the form x is F, (ii) her justification for believing that proposition rests on justification for believing that y is F and y=x, and (iii) unbeknownst to the subject, y≠x (Pryor 1999, 274–5). So defined, de re misidentification is obviously possible in the first-person case: I see someone on a security camera with a bump on his head, mistakenly assume the person I see is me, and judge “I have a bump on my head.” Longuenesse retains the distinction between uses of “I” as subject vs. as object and elaborates on them in terms of Sartre’s accounts of reflective self-consciousness and the distinction between “I” and “me” developed in The Transcendence of the Ego. I conclude that Longuenesse’s Sartrean view is preferable to Aucouturier’s Anscombean view on two counts: “I” is a referring expression and there is a legitimate distinction between uses of “I” as subject vs. as object.
Morris’s contribution continues a line of interpretation she develops in more detail in her 2008 book. Morris reads Sartre as making, like Wittgenstein, “therapeutic” interventions into traditional disputes by undermining false presuppositions on which they rest. Morris argues that Sartre’s account of the Look is analogous to Wittgenstein’s “criterial” solution to the problem of other minds: “certainty” in the existence of other minds is an unquestionable, presupposed framework for “knowledge” of particular others’ mental states. On my view, the Wittgensteinian therapeutic reading misses out on what is most important to Sartre’s project. This reading seems to be in tension with Sartre’s aspiration to provide a new “phenomenological ontology” concerned with distinguishing two regions of being (being-in-itself and being-for-itself), articulating the structure of being-for-itself, and investigating how to unify the two regions under the single heading of “being.” This radical new ontology comes into especially clear focus in Sartre’s discussion of the “reef of solipsism.”
Morris sees Sartre and Wittgenstein as exposing a false presupposition about the relation between behavior and mentality that undergirds traditional discussions of solipsism—namely, the assumption that the data on which our knowledge of other minds rest are purely physical facts that can be understood independently of their embeddedness in a situation and the mental states that they manifest. I agree with Morris’s claim that, for Sartre, a more accurate phenomenology of the encounter with another person—a phenomenology according to which a red face and clenched fist are just the outer profile of the other’s anger—explains how we have knowledge of others’ mental states. But I think this therapeutic move only explains the first stage of Sartre’s analysis—the stage concerned with knowledge of the “other-as-object” (illustrated with the man in the park vignette)—and not the more interesting and controversial second stage—the stage concerned with certainty of the “other-as-subject” (the keyhole vignette).
As Morris points out, Sartre describes the awareness of the other in shame as a “slightly expanded cogito,” which seems to suggest that the existence of the other is indubitable. Morris affirms as much: “That is just Sartre’s point: that scepticism about the existence of other subjects is no more seriously entertainable than scepticism about one’s own existence” (Morris 2024, 124). This strikes me as not just false, but false by Sartre’s own lights. Sartre is quite clear that whatever is revealed with certainty in shame, it is not concrete other persons; for example, the footsteps I seem to hear as I peer through the keyhole could turn out to be the wind. What, then, is revealed with cogito-level assurance in shame? Mark Sacks describes the other-as-subject as “a presupposed structural element of the world that is necessitated by my very upsurge” (Sacks 2005, 294). Moreover, shame is supposed to reveal that I have an “outside” (Sartre 2018, 360), or equivalently that I have “being-for-others,” an element of my being that forms a “detotalized totality” with my being-for-myself (Sartre 2018, 389). (On my view, shame involves a “slightly expanded cogito” precisely because, like Descartes’s cogito, it reveals something about me.) These notions obviously cry out for further elucidation, but against Morris, I find it impossible to interpret Sartre here as simply deflating a traditional problem; he seems, on the contrary, to be offering a revisionary ontology of the human person.
Objections to particular claims and interpretations notwithstanding, Sartre and Analytic Philosophy collects together essays that will be of interest both to Sartre scholars and to scholars working on self-consciousness, intersubjectivity, emotion, imagination, and related topics in the philosophy of mind.
REFERENCES
Anscombe, E. 1981. “The First Person.” In Metaphysics and the Philosophy of Mind, 21–36. Oxford: Basil Blackwell.
Kaplan, D. 1989. “Demonstrates: An Essay on the Semantics, Logic, Metaphysics, and Epistemology of Demonstratives and Other Indexicals.” In J. Almog, J. Perry, and H. Wettstein (eds.), Themes from Kaplan, 481–563. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Morris, K. 2008. Sartre. Hoboken: Wiley-Blackwell.
Pryor, J. 1999. “Immunity to Error through Misidentification,” Philosophical Topics 26 (1&2): 271–304.
Sacks, M. 2005. “Sartre, Strawson and Others,” Inquiry 48 (3): 275–99.
Sartre, J.-P. 2018. Being and Nothingness. S. Richmond (trans.). New York: Washington Square Press.
Shoemaker, S. 1968. “Self-Reference and Self-Awareness,” The Journal of Philosophy 65 (19): 555–67.