Naomi Fisher’s Schelling’s Mystical Platonism has at last given English-language scholarship a monument to F. W. J. Schelling’s early Platonism to rival Werner Beierwaltes’ work in German and Jean-Louis Vieillard-Baron’s work in French.
It pulls this off by way of four major interventions. First, Fisher understands Schelling’s unique place within the post-Kantian philosophical landscape in light of his “mystical Platonism”, i.e., his claim that “everything is grounded in the inarticulable absolute” (209). That is, what makes Schelling distinctive in relation to his contemporaries is twofold. (a) Schelling is to be labelled a Platonist primarily because of his commitment to a priority monism, that is, “a monism in which there is a unitary being that is prior to and grounds all things that exist” (186). He argues that what grounds a discursive system must itself stand outside that system—this is, for Fisher, his unique response to the German Idealist grounding problem bequeathed by Reinhold and the early Fichte. (b) One reason for this response is the mystical character of Schelling’s Platonism. A monistic, i.e., unconditioned, ground cannot sit within a conceptual system, because concepts condition what is in terms of what it is not. Hence, there is a dilemma: “Either the [grounding] principle is conceptually articulated or it is unconditioned” (33). Since, on the one hand, what is conditioned cannot function as a monistic explanatory ground and since, on the other hand, what is unconditioned cannot be rationally determined, there results a “commitment to the ineffability of the first principle” (34). This commitment reveals, in Fisher’s opinion, Schelling’s affinity with Jacobi’s and Maimon’s epistemologies (i.e., their scepticism towards discursive cognition) but does so via renewal of a Platonic distinction between ordinary acts of knowing and the divine dispensation of genius.
Secondly, Fisher intervenes in debates over Schelling’s historical familiarity with the Platonic tradition, particularly the ways in which Schelling “imbibed systematic Neoplatonism in direct and indirect ways” (88). Proclus benefits most from her expert eye for Neoplatonic resonances within his published works, unpublished notebooks, and institutional contexts, e.g., C. F. Pfleiderer’s Proclus-inspired teaching at the Tübinger Stift or the derivation of the Potenzlehre, in part, from Proclus’ Commentary on Euclid’s Elements. Her research marks a substantial shift in the field (compare, for example, Xavier Tilliette’s claim that “Plotinianism and Schelling is still the order of the day” (1987, 59, my emphasis)). What also clearly emerges as the book unfolds is the extent to which Schelling modifies this Platonic inheritance. The Conclusion makes a case for Schelling not repeating Neoplatonism in order to construct a dogmatic refuge sheltered from the demands of modernity, but rather as “circl[ing] back to the past with the eyes of the present” (212). In particular, Fisher focuses on Schelling’s reform of Neoplatonic models of emanation, procession and return: materiality is not for Schelling the point of maximal denigration from the absolute, but a medium by which to participate in absoluteness. Ultimately, Fisher describes this kind of creative appropriation of Plato so forcefully that the reader is led to ask: at what point is a transformed Platonic doctrine no longer Platonic? E.g., what would Schelling need to have done to the concept of emanation to take it outside the Platonic tradition?
Thirdly, Fisher intervenes in contemporary Schelling-scholarship by offering alternative images of Schelling and Plato. This involves, in part, combatting loose talk of Plato’s influence on Schelling by, instead, tracing in salutary and concrete detail the various ways in which the Philebus-dialectic of limit, unlimited, mixture and demiurgic cause is redeployed throughout his early works. That is, Fisher battles against a series of clichés in the scholarship concerning Schelling’s attitude towards “two-world” Platonic dualism or even the “one-world” physicalism of the Timaeus by means of defamiliarizing the image of Plato on which those of us without expertise in ancient philosophy tend to rely. In Fisher’s words, “Schelling’s Platonism is not our Platonism” (3).
Fourthly, and more fundamentally still, Fisher’s book acts as a call for renewal of the research field in general. After the Wild-West years of anglophone Schelling scholarship which lasted as late as the 2010s, and after the subsequent “Schelling renaissance” which has tended to read the early Schelling as a thinker of immanence in close dialogue with Spinoza, Fisher gestures at something different. While she inherits a concern for the “continuity-thesis” from the “Schelling renaissance” (i.e., the guiding hermeneutic principle that Schelling doesn’t constantly change his mind), she otherwise positions herself in a scholarly “third-wave” that, on the one hand, aims to overturn the immanent reading and, on the other hand, feeds into a new interpretative community of “analytic Schellingians” (alongside others like G. Anthony Bruno, Karin Nisenbaum and Lara Ostaric, with whom Fisher is most frequently in conversation throughout the book). The figure of Spinoza often acts as foil for this new interpretative direction: Fisher draws a hard distinction between Platonic priority monism and Spinozan substance monism, in order to reject the latter as a model owing to its inability to grant finite things independence and freedom.
The above four interventions made by Schelling’s Mystical Platonism take place over eight chapters split evenly into two parts, bookended by a short, programmatic introduction and conclusion. The first part covers Schelling’s juvenilia from 1792 to 1795, particularly the Plato-notebooks of 1792–4, the Timaeus-commentary of 1794 and the 1795 essay, Of the I as Principle of Philosophy, or the Unconditional in Human Knowledge. It describes the nature of Schelling’s commitments to Platonism forged at Tübingen, including, for example, the legacy of the epistemology of the Ion, and provides a useful corrective to overly Kantian readings of the Timaeus-commentary. The second part then traces lines of development from the 1797 Ideas for a Philosophy of Nature to the 1802 dialogue, Bruno, or On the Natural and Divine Principle of Things. To the question of what is at stake after 1795 if it is the case that Schelling’s mystical Platonism has already been so well established prior to that date, Fisher has a series of robust responses that show repeatedly how the early model is enriched and complicated, but never abandoned.
The book’s cut-off date of 1802 might, at first sight, seem to omit much, particularly as it cuts in half what is often considered a unitary epoch in Schelling’s trajectory (the “identity philosophy”), e.g., should the 1804 Würzburg-System be read as a variant of mystical Platonism on Fisher’s account? Nevertheless, concluding the book in 1802 makes a lot of sense insofar as it allows her, on the one hand, to bracket the impact of Schelling’s 1804 reading of Plotinus, which takes his Neoplatonism-reception in a different direction, and, on the other hand, to foreground Bruno as an unsurpassed testament to Schellingian Platonism. This dialogue has tended to be somewhat marginalised in the “Schelling renaissance” and Fisher’s recovery of it is an enjoyable highlight, particularly her fine-grained observations of the narrative drama. She convincingly shows how, over the course of the dialogue, the character “Anselm” undergoes a gradual conversion from crude “two-world” Platonism to “a Platonic system compatible with Schelling’s own overarching commitments” (204).
However, another set of less trivial omissions are those texts that do date from the period between 1795 and 1802 but which Fisher marginalises. The set includes the 1796 Anti-Critique which appears to do away with the question of monistic grounding (and so one motivation for priority monism) by insisting on liberating philosophers from “ill-fated inquiries into a first principle of philosophy” (1976, 190). It also includes the 1800 Universal Deduction of the Dynamic Process which is—in some respects—the most Platonic of his turn-of-the-century writings, because of both its identification of potency with spatial dimension and its thematization of anamnesis (“The Platonic idea that all philosophy is recollection is true in this sense: all philosophising consists in a recollection of the condition in which we were one with nature” (1976, 363)).
A different kind of omission from Fisher’s account is Novalis, one of Jena’s more sophisticated readers of the Neoplatonic tradition in the late 1790s. Although Novalis does not share Schelling’s Tübingen background in the way Hölderlin (who is a frequent reference point) did, he has traditionally played an idiosyncratic role in debates over Schelling’s Platonism due to Harold Holz’s suggestion that Schelling learnt Neoplatonism from both oral conversations and no-longer-extant correspondence with Novalis (1970). Whatever the (implausible) merits of this conjecture, it does suggest that to determine the uniqueness of Schelling’s position as “mystical Platonist” requires some comparison with Novalis’ particular brand of Platonism and mysticism.
One further kind of omission concerns Fisher’s use of the mystic tradition. She is extremely sensitive to the “rich history” of theories of the ineffable (167) and, as a result, situates Schelling’s early philosophy happily in an apophatic tradition that passes from Plato and Proclus, through pseudo-Dionysius, Giordano Bruno and Jakob Böhme, to Jacobi and Maimon. However, as such a list might suggest, this gesture presupposes a certain flattening out of the tradition, such that all these figures end up making one and the same claim (that the absolute cannot be articulated) without much attention to the very real differences in how they each fail to articulate the absolute, i.e., to the particular discursive strategies of unsaying the absolute they each practise. Hence, what might concretely separate Proclus’s deployment of analogy from the interplay of affirmation and negation in pseudo-Dionysius and the more kataphatic tendencies of Bruno and Böhme is somewhat lost, resulting in a relatively abstract conception of “the mystical”.
One corollary to this treatment of the mystical is Fisher’s tendency to reduce Schellingian intellectual intuition to an organ of apophasis. She speaks of intellectual intuition as “supersensible inspiration” (99), as immediate access to “higher, nondiscursive, incommunicable truth” (58) and as akin to “mystical union” (95)—and this might well confirm what many have feared: the early Schelling’s dogmatism, exceptionalism, and evasion of critical or sceptical challenges. And yet, in one section at least, Fisher also provides a more deflationary description of Schelling’s concept of intuition (as part of his method of exhibition) emerging out of post-Kantian debates over its role in mathematical construction. It was—for me at least—challenging to reconcile the two seemingly different accounts (and, notably, Schelling’s On Construction stands just outside the book’s timeframe).
However, to speak of some omissions as I have in the second half of this review is really to say very little and is certainly not to impugn the quality, persuasive power, and precision of the text itself. Fisher has decisively moved the debate on and produced definitive resources for a mature consideration of Schelling’s Platonism in the English language.
REFERENCES
X. Tilliette, L'absolu et la philosophie: Essais sur Schelling, Paris: PUF, 1987.
F. W. J. Schelling, Historisch-Kritische Ausgabe [HKA], ed. Manfred Durner et al., Stuttgart, Frommann-Holzboog, 1976—, I/3.
Schelling, HKA I/8.
H. Holz, Spekulation und Faktizität: Zum Freiheitsbegriff der mittleren und späten Schelling, Bonn, Bouvier, 1970, p53–60.