Consider just one of Nietzsche’s many veiled critical assessments of Schopenhauer’s—his great educator’s—ethics of compassion:
Let us reflect seriously upon this question: why do we leap after someone who has fallen into the water in front of us, even though we feel no kind of affection for him? Out of pity: at that moment we are thinking only of the other person—thus says thoughtlessness (Daybreak 133).
If we factor in the tendency for such Nietzschean caricatures to constitute many first encounters with Schopenhauer’s moral philosophy, then it is no wonder that the fight to give it a proper hearing and to overcome the charge of ‘thoughtlessness’ has been an uphill battle. Thankfully, the expert contributors to this volume have plowed on undeterred. The result—the victory—is a set of non-dogmatic essays demonstrating the complexity, range, and practical viability of an ethics of compassion, one whose ground principle is quite simple: ‘Harm no one; rather help everyone to the extent that you can’ (OBM, 140).
The authors in this nine chapter volume will be familiar to those working on Schopenhauer’s ethics: Stephen Puryear, Colin Marshall, Sandra Shapshay, Patrick Hassan (editor), Gudrun von Tevenar, Mark Migotti, David Bather Woods, and Christopher Janaway. Also featured is a standout essay on pessimism and the morality of suicide by Michael Cholbi, who is well-known outside Schopenhauer circles for his writings on the philosophy of death and dying. The editor, Patrick Hassan, deserves special praise for the way the volume is organized, as the selection of essays are suited for satisfying a diverse set of reader motivations. Those interested in metaethics and axiology will want to dive into the early chapters on Schopenhauer’s assessment of the normative force (or lack thereof) of moral oughts (Puryear), his moral methodology in parts of OBM (Marshall), and his realist metaphysics of inherent value (Shapshay). Middle chapters confront issues in Schopenhauer’s normative ethics and moral psychology, like the problems of egoism and self-effacement which are thought to plague certain forms of virtue theory (Hassan), as well as the precise nature of his negative assessment of happiness, i.e., the claim that it has no positive value of its own, but is merely the momentary suspension of suffering (von Tevenar). Later chapters offer careful interpretations and evaluations of Schopenhauer’s treatment of more ‘applied’ issues: animal ethics (Migotti), suicide (Cholbi), and sexual morality (Woods). The volume’s final chapter consists of a very welcome comparative effort appraising Schopenhauer’s true debt to so-called “Indian” ethics (Janaway).
Despite the wide range of topics covered, there is a noticeable unity in the approach many of these authors take to understanding Schopenhauer’s ethics. What we find is that the morass of issues being worked through are mostly all traceable to a single source, namely Schopenhauer’s claim to have simultaneously presented a moral outlook with both an empirical and a transcendental backing. So, while out of one corner of his mouth he tells us that his critique of Kant’s ethics shows that ‘there remains no other path to the discovery of the foundation of ethics than the empirical one, namely investigating whether there are any actions at all to which we must assign genuine moral worth’ (OBM, 189), out of the other we hear that compassion is a feeling that carries an intuitive insight about the nature of fundamental reality: ‘My true, inner essence exists in every living thing as immediately as it reveals itself in my self-consciousness to myself alone’ (OBM, 254). Apparently, Schopenhauer is having his cake and eating too. But does this result in an intelligible and practicable moral framework?
Some of the contributors to this volume seem to think so, or at least present readings of the texts aimed at explaining how this might be possible. Marshall, for example, deftly works through the details of Schopenhauer’s ‘Titus Argument’ so that we can extract lessons about his larger moral methodology. Imagine yourself on the brink of inflicting harm on a romantic rival. Now consider a range of different moral thought contents that are intended to represent different moral theories: Kant’s, Smith’s, Wollaston’s, etc. Schopenhauer expects us to see that none of these—placing the act before the moral law or impartial spectators; taking it to express a false proposition; and so on—are any good. What is much better is when we imagine Titus moved by compassion. But what exactly is the ‘argument’ and what is it trying to show? According to Marshall, the argument is meant to reveal a certain principle that Schopenhauer subscribes to, namely that ‘proper moral motivations’ will be expressive of deeper underlying metaethical (and metaphysical) commitments. What we see, then, is that ‘part of Schopenhauer’s metaethics is in fact implicit in Titus’ statement, since Schopenhauer thinks there really is nothing more to compassion than the intrinsically motivating apprehension of the other’s suffering’ (42). With this argument, Schopenhauer seeks to draw a line between moral motivation and moral metaphysics, a move Marshall tells us many contemporary theorists are unlikely to support.
We also find the claim that moral motivation is expressive of a metaethically (and metaphysically) deep insight in Shapshay’s essay (although it is part of her argument that in other work Marshall did not get the phenomenology of compassionate motivation quite right). She begins by pointing out a similarity between aesthetic and moral perception in Schopenhauer. Each turns out to be a mode ‘by which subjects can have epistemic access—albeit still mediated access—to the way the world is in itself’ (52). Might the similarity run deeper? Could moral perception be like aesthetic perception in raising the moral subject to a level of will-less contemplation of another’s suffering? The answer that Shapshay convincingly argues for is ‘no’. Unlike aesthetic perception, moral perception is not will-less; the moral agent, after all, wills the other’s well-being. With this difference established, Shapshay argues that what we recognize in moral perception is ‘the positive, inherent value that is shared between the “I” and the “Other”’ (53). Practically speaking, this perception of shared value is what motivates agents to alleviate suffering. But what ultimately explains this epistemic access to the other’s shared value? The answer of course will be Schopenhauer’s metaphysics, but not as typically understood. For here Shapshay breaks from conventional readings to argue that ‘the monist element at the heart of compassionate insight is [. . .] pantheism (67). It is this ‘spiritualist’ or ‘mystical’ reading of Schopenhauer’s compassion-based ethics that Shapshay offers us. By taking seriously Schopenhauer’s claim that, empirically, it is a great mystery how anyone could ever act compassionately, we are forced to locate the explanation of such behavior at a different, ‘divine’ level (68). And this, Shapshay tells us, lends support to reading Schopenhauer’s ethics as a kind of practical mysticism.
Shapshay’s creative and convincing interpretive work does leave me wondering whether by ‘going mystical’ Schopenhauer ultimately decided to relinquish the claim to empirical backing mentioned above (and fair enough if the answer is ‘yes’). As Schopenhauer likes to remind his readers, he is the first to have truly explained the everyday belief that the world has a moral meaning. But if we must resort to mysticism to give such an explanation, it begins to feel disingenuous on his part to take credit for giving a purely empirical or descriptive account of moral conduct and experience. At any rate, there’s clearly a deeper debate brewing here, since later in the volume Janaway shows that if Schopenhauer wishes to maintain an affinity between his moral philosophy and that of the Ancient ‘Indians’, he needs to be more noncommittal about the nature of the fundamental Oneness of reality. For Janaway, ‘[the] universal ancient truth [. . .] is that ultimate reality is One, without further specification. It is at least not specified to be will. On the evidence of this statement, “the thing in itself as will” cannot be counted as essential to the real ground of ethics (186)’. And so, we return to the main question plaguing Schopenhauer’s practical philosophy: how much of it can stand on its own empirical grounds? Or, maybe the better question is, how much of it is he willing to let stand on its own without giving into the temptation to reach for transcendental support?
As we get on in the volume, we encounter several pieces that should appeal to those interested in more applied ethical issues. In both von Tevenar’s and Migotti’s chapters, for instance, we find exciting elucidations of Schopenhauer’s animal ethics. Migotti’s piece is especially interesting for raising the question of how to square Schopenhauer’s untimely but praiseworthy concern for animal welfare with his wider ethical outlook. On the one hand, Schopenhauer lauds individuals who are able to take on the world’s sufferings to the point of letting go of their attachment to the world and achieving a state of volitional self-renunciation; on the other hand, he clearly thinks animals are owed certain treatment, none of which can be given to them if we’ve become ascetically detached. In Migotti’s terms: how is ‘human sainthood’ supposed to help animals? (135). The conclusion he reaches on this score is striking. In a playful riff on a familiar story, Migotti contends that Old Macdonald, even after he has resigned from this word, ‘understands that he can’t neglect [his animals] just because he has become enlightened’ (135). In sum, animals and their welfare tether us to life even after we’ve achieved ascetic enlightenment.
But this conclusion left me puzzled in two respects. First, it is unclear whether concern for animal welfare constitutes a positive reason to cling to, rather than turn away from, life. If, owing to their limited intelligence, animals must cling to life come what may, and if clinging to life comes with the vulnerability to suffering Schopenhauer is at pains to point out (and which von Tevenar nicely explains in her chapter), then doesn’t that give human moral agents a positive duty to stick around themselves? Second, I felt Migotti let Schopenhauer (and himself) off easy when it came to evaluating the ethics of a carnivorous diet in light of the conclusions he reaches at the end of the chapter. If I am willing to forsake the summum bonum—ascetic self-negation—for animals, then that surely implies that animals have a value that activities surrounding their consumption violate.
Philosophers working on the ethics of sexual conduct should absolutely read Woods’ chapter on Schopenhauer’s sexual ethics. Particularly noteworthy is Woods’ discussion of what he calls the third principle of Schopenhauer’s sexual ethics: ‘willingness is sufficient to neutralize the harm in any sexual practice’ (169). With this principle in hand, Woods goes on to treat cases of sexual seduction, explaining why Schopenhauer would find such activity immoral. In a case of seduction, the willingness of the seduced party is likely to have occurred ‘under false pretenses’ (170). Thus, even if there then goes on to be some level of sexual pleasure attained in the activity, there was an earlier harm that renders the activity immoral. What we have here is the makings of a Schopenhauerian ethics of seduction that is worthy of further investigation.
In a review of this size one cannot treat every theme one would like. For example, I would have liked to say more about Puryear’s treatment of Schopenhauer’s account of moral normativity; Hassan’s making a further go at reading Schopenhauer as a virtue theorist; von Tevenar’s solution to the problem of negative happiness; and Cholbi’s integrity-based reading of suicide. Nor can one give each author the space their contributions deserve. But in this case, this lament speaks directly to the high quality of this volume. Each chapter deserves a space of its own to be discussed. This is a volume that deepens our knowledge of Schopenhauer’s moral philosophy, filling in details that no Nietzschean caricature could ever hope to capture.